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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge
be the meet of the agents' partitions
i
for each i
N.
A proposition E
is common knowledge for the agents of N at
iff
(
)
E.
In Aumann (1976), E is defined to be common knowledge at
iff
(
)
E.
Proof.
(
) By Lemma 2.12,
(
)
is common knowledge at
, so E is common knowledge at
by Proposition 2.4.
(
) We must show that K *N ( E ) implies that
(
)
E.
Suppose that there exists 
(
)
such that 
E.
Since 
(
),

is reachable from
,
so there exists a sequence 0, 1, . . . , m - 1 with associated states
1,
2, . . . ,
m and information sets
i k(
k ) such that
0 =
,
m = 
, and
k
i k(
k + 1). But at information set
i k(
m ), agent i k does not know event E. Working backwards on k, we see that event E cannot be common knowledge, that is, agent i 1 cannot rule out the possibility that agent i 2 thinks that . . . that agent i m - 1 thinks that agent i m does not know E.
First published: August 27, 2001
Content last modified: August 27, 2001