Common Knowledge > Proof of Proposition 2.5 (Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy/Fall 2007 Edition)

Proof of Proposition 2.5

Proposition 2.5.
ω ∈ K^m_N(A) iff

(1) For all agents i₁, i₂, … , i_m ∈ N, ω ∈ K_i₁K_i₂ … K_{i_m}(A)

Hence, ω ∈ K^*_N(A) iff (1) is the case for each m ≥ 1.

Proof.
Note first that

(2)

∩
^{i₁ ∈ N}

K_i₁ (

∩
^{i₂ ∈ N}

K_i₂ ( … (

∩
^{i_m−1 ∈ N}

K_{i_m−1} (

∩
^{i_m ∈ N}

K_{i_m}(A) ) ) ) )

∩
^{i₁ ∈ N}

K_i1 (

∩
^{i₂ ∈ N}

K_i₂ ( … (

∩
^{i_m−1 ∈ N}

K_{i_m−1}(K¹_N(A))) ) )

∩
^{i₁ ∈ N}

K_i₁ (

∩
^{i₂ ∈ N}

K_i₂ … (

∩
^{i_m−2 ∈ N}

K_{i_m−2}(K²_N(A)) ) )

= …

∩
^{i₁ ∈ N}

K_i₁(K^m−1_N(A))

K^m_N(A)

By (2),

K^m_N(A) ⊆ K_i₁K_i₂ … K_{i_m}(A)

for i₁, i₂, …, i_m ∈ N, so if ω ∈ K^m_N(A) then condition (1) is satisfied. Condition (1) is equivalent to

ω ∈ ∩
^{i₁ ∈ N} K_i₁ ( ∩
^{i₂ ∈ N} K_i₂ ( … ( ∩
^{i_m−1 ∈ N} K_{i_m−1} ( ∩
^{i_m ∈ N} K_{i_m}(A) ) ) ) )

so by (2), if (1) is satisfied then ω ∈ K^m_N(A). QED