Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Deontic Logic

Kripke-Style Semantics for SDL

We define the frames (structures) for modeling SDL as follows:

F is an Kripke-SDL (or KD) Frame: F = <W,A> such that:
  1. W is a non-empty set
  2. A is a subset of W × W
  3. A is serial: ∀i∃jAij.

A model can be defined in the usual way, allowing us to then define truth at a world in a model for all sentences of SDL (and SDL+):

M is an Kripke-SDL Model: M = <F,V>, where F is an SDL Frame, <W,A>, and V is an assignment on F: V is a function from the propositional variables to various subsets of W (the “truth sets’ for the variables—the worlds where the variables are true for this assignment).

Let “M ⊨i p” denote p's truth at a world, i, in a model, M.

Basic Truth-Conditions at a world, i, in a Model, M:
[PC]: (Standard Clauses for the operators of Propositional Logic.)
[OB]: M ⊨i OBp: “∀j[if Aij then M ⊨j p]

Derivative Truth-Conditions:
[PE]: M ⊨i PEp: ∃j(Aij & M ⊨j p)
[IM]: M ⊨i IMp: ~∃j(Aij & M ⊨j p)
[OM]: M ⊨i OMp: ∃j(Aij & M ⊨j ~p)
[OP]: M ⊨i OPp: ∃j(Aij & M ⊨j p) & ∃j(Aij & M ⊨j ~p)

p is true in the model, M (M ⊨ p): p is true at every world in M.

p is valid (⊨ p): p is true in every model.

Metatheorem: SDL is sound and complete for the class of all Kripke-SDL models.[1]

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