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We can name this concept using ourH(x =
H
& H
F)
-notation as follows:
[Instead of writing out this lengthy expression being an x which is an extension of a concept equinumerous to F, let us abbreviate ourx
H(x =
H
& H
F)]
-notation for this concept as
`F#'. Note that the extension of this concept,
F#(
), contains only extensions as members.
Now Frege's explicit definition of `the number of Fs' can be given as follows:
#F =dfThis definition identifies the number of Fs as the extension that contains all and only those extensions of concepts that are equinumerous to F.F#(
)
We can complete our preliminary work for the proof of Hume's Principle by formulating and proving the following Lemma (derived from Basic Law V), which simplifies the proof of Hume's Principle:
Lemma for Hume's Principle:This Lemma tells us that an extension such as
G
![]()
#F
G
F
G
will be a
member of #F just in case G is equinumerous to F.
Clearly, since F is equinumerous to itself, it follows that
#F contains
F
as a member. From these facts, one can get a
sense of how Frege derived Hume's Principle Basic Law V in Gg.
Here is a reconstruction of the argument.
A Derivation of Hume's Principle from Basic Law V