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The Lemma on Predecessor+ can be proved with the help of the following Lemma:
Lemma: No Number Ancestrally Precedes ItselfNow the Lemma on Predecessor+ asserts:
x[
x
![]()
Precedes*(x,x)]
(Proof) [Exercise for the Reader]
To prove this, assume thatx & Precedes(y,x)
![]()
#[z Precedes+(z,y)] = #[
z Precedes+(z,x) & z
x]
n and
Precedes(m,n). We want to show:
#[By Hume's Principle, it suffices to show:z Precedes+(z,m)] = #[
z Precedes+(z,n) & z
n]
[Now it is a fact about equinumerosity (see the Facts About Equinumerosity, in §3, Equinumerosity, Fact 1) that if two concepts are materially equivalent, then they are equinumerous. It therefore suffices to show thatz Precedes+(z,m)]
[
z Precedes+(z,n) & z
n]
And byx([
z Precedes+(z,m)]x
[
z Precedes+(z,n) & z
n]x)
-Conversion, it suffices to show:
So let us pick an arbitrary object, say a, and show:x[Precedes+(x,m)
Precedes+(x,n) & x
n]
Precedes+(a,m)Precedes+(a,n) & a
n
(
) Assume
Precedes+(a,m). Then from our
assumption that Precedes(m,n) and a Fact about
R+ (see §4, Weak Ancestral, Facts
About R+, Fact 2), it follows that
Precedes*(a,n). A fortiori, then,
Precedes+(a,n). Now by the Lemma
mentioned at the outset of this proof, namely, No Natural Number
Ancestrally Precedes Itself, we know that
Precedes*(n,n).
Since a ancestrally precedes n and n does not, it
follows that a
n. We have
therefore proved what we were after, namely:
Precedes+(a,n) & a(n
) Assume
Precedes+(a,n) and a
n. By definition, the first conjunct
tells us that either Precedes*(a,n) or a =
n. Since we know by assumption that the latter disjunct is not
true, we know Precedes*(a,n). But from this fact
and our assumption that Precedes(m,n), it follows
from a fact about R+ (see §4, Weak Ancestral,
Facts About R+, Fact 7), that
Precedes+(a,m), which is what we had
to show.