| Chinese Term |
Approximate English Pronunciation |
| Bi (other) | “be” as in the verb
“to be” |
| Bian (disputation) |
“be-yen!” pronounced as a single syllable |
| Ci (expressions) |
“tsuh?” as in
“catsup,” dropping the initial ‘ca’ and final
‘p’ |
| Da Qu (“Big Selection”) |
“da!” “chew” |
| Fei (not-this, wrong) |
“fey” |
| He (matching) |
“her?” without the
final ‘r’ |
| Jian ai (inclusive concern) |
“jee-yen,” pronounced as a single syllable;
“I!” as in “I do” |
| Ke (admissible) |
“ker” without
the final ‘r’ |
| Li (benefit) |
“lee!” |
| Mou (drawing parallels) |
“moe?” |
| Mozi (classical text) |
“mwo!”
followed by “dz” |
| Pi (analogy) |
“pee!” |
| Qi (breath, energy) |
“chee!” as in
“cheese” |
| Quan (weighing) |
“ch” as in
“cheese” followed by “when?” |
| Shi (this, right) |
“shr!” or
“sher!” as in “Sherlock” |
| Shí (reality, things, objects) |
“shr?” or
“sher?” as in “Sherlock” |
| Shuo (explanation) |
“shwo” |
| Tian (heaven) |
“tee-yen,”
pronounced as a single syllable |
| Tong (same, similar) |
“tohng?”
(“toe” plus an “-ng?” ending) |
| Tui (extending) |
“tway” |
| Xi (happiness) |
“shee” as in
‘banshee’ |
| Xiao Qu (“Small Selection”) |
“sheow” (rhymes with “meow”)
“chew” |
| Xing (shape) |
“sheeng?”
“shee” as in ‘banshee’ plus an
“-ng?” ending |
| Xu (empty, hollow) |
like “issue”
without the initial ‘i’ |
| Xunzi (classical Confucian text) |
“issue,” without the initial ‘i’ and
adding a final ‘n?’, followed by “dz” |
| Yi (thought, intention) |
“e!” (a
clipped pronunciation of the letter “e”) |
| Yi (duty, morality) |
“e!” |
| Yuan (citing) |
“yoo-wen?,”
pronounced as a single syllable |
| Zhi (knowledge) |
“jr!,” roughly
like “jerk” without the final ‘k’ |
| Zhi (intention) |
“jr!” |
| Zhuangzi (classical Daoist text) |
“joo-wong” pronounced as one syllable, followed
by “dz” |