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In his important 1956 article, "Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind", Sellars introduced the idea that our conception of mentality may be derived not from direct access to the inner workings of our own minds, but instead from a primitive theoretical framework that we inherit from our culture. While Sellars himself regarded this theoretical framework as empirically correct, his claim that our conception of the mind is theory-based, and at least in principle falsifiable, would be influential to later supporters of eliminativism.
In articles such as "Mental Events and the Brain" (1963), Paul Feyerabend explicitly endorsed the idea that common-sense psychology might prove to be radically false. Indeed, Feyerabend held that practically any version of materialism would severely undermine common-sense psychology. Like many of his contemporaries, Feyerabend argued that common-sense mental notions are essentially non-physical in character. Thus, for him, any form of physicalism would entail that there are no mental processes or states as understood by common-sense (1963, p. 295).
Like Feyerabend, Quine also endorsed the idea that mental notions like belief or sensation could simply be abandoned in favor of a more accurate physiological account. In a brief passage in Word and Object (1960), Quine suggests that terms denoting the physical correlates of mental states will be more useful and, as he puts it, "[t]he bodily states exist anyway; why add the others?" (p. 264). However, Quine goes on to question just how radical an eliminativist form of materialism would actually be, implying no significant difference between explicating mental states as physiological states, and eliminating mental state terms in favor of physical state terms. He asks, "Is physicalism a repudiation of mental objects after all, or a theory of them? Does it repudiate the mental state of pain or anger in favor of its physical concomitant, or does it identify the mental state with a state of the physical organism (and so a state of the physical organism with the mental state)" (p. 265)? Quine answers this question by rejecting it, suggesting there is no interesting difference between the two cases: "Some may therefore find comfort in reflecting that the distinction between an eliminative and an explicative physicalism is unreal" (p. 265).
Here we see a tension that runs throughout the writings of many early eliminative materialists. The problem involves a vacillation between two different conditions under which mental concepts and terms are dropped. The first scenario proposes that certain mental concepts will turn out to be empty, with mental state terms referring to nothing that actually exists. Historical analogs for this way of understanding eliminativism are cases where we (now) say it turned out there are no such things, such as demons and crystal spheres. The second scenario suggests that the conceptual framework provided by neurosciences (or some other physical account) can or should come to replace the common-sense framework we now use. Unlike the first scenario, the second allows that mental state terms may actually designate something real -- it's just that what they designate turn out to be brain states, which will be more accurately described using the terminology of the relevant sciences. One possible model for this way of thinking about eliminativism might be the discontinuance of talk about germs in favor of more precise scientific terminology of infectious agents. Given these two different conceptions, early eliminativists would sometimes offer two different characterizations of their view: (a) There are no mental states, just brain states and, (b) There really are mental states, but they are just brain states (and we will come to view them that way).
These alternative ways of understanding eliminative materialism produced considerable confusion about what, exactly, eliminative materialism entailed. Moreover, since it was difficult to see how the second version was significantly different from various forms of reductive materialism (hence, Quine's skepticism about the difference between elimination and explication) it also raised doubts about the distinctiveness of eliminative materialism.
Much of this was brought to light in the discussion generated by an influential 1965 article by Richard Rorty entitled, "Mind-Body Identity, Privacy, and Categories". Rorty's so-called "disappearance" theory appeared to openly endorse both conceptions of eliminative materialism, suggesting that sensations do not actually exist and that they are nothing but brain processes (p. 28). As one might expect, the ensuing discussion focused on getting clear on what Rorty's theory actually claimed, and one helpful article by William Lycan and George Pappas (1972) -- entitled, appropriately enough, "What Is Eliminative Materialism?" -- convincingly argued that you cant have it both ways. You can either claim that common sense mental notions do not pick out anything real -- in which case you are a true eliminative materialist; or you can claim that mental notions can be, in some way, reduced to neurological (or perhaps computational) states of the brain -- in which case you are really just a good-old fahioned materialist/reductionist. In a follow-up article, Steven Savitt (1974) introduced the distinction between ontologically conservative (reductive) and ontologically radical (eliminative) theory change, which helped to further clarify and distinguish the central claims of eliminative materialism as it is understood today.
In more recent history, eliminative materialism has received attention from a broader range of writers, including many concerned not only with the metaphysics of the mind, but also the process of theory change, the status of semantic properties, the nature of psychological explanation and recent developments in cognitive science. Much of this attention has been fostered by the husband-wife team of Paul and Patricia Churchland, whose writings have forced many philosophers and cognitive scientists to take eliminativism more seriously. In his 1981 article, "Eliminative Materialism and the Propositional Attitudes", Paul Churchalnd presents several arguments in favor of dropping commonsense psychology that have shaped the modern debate about the status of ordinary notions like belief. Patricia Churchland's provocative 1986 book, Neurophilosophy, suggests that developments in neuroscience point to a bleak future for commonsense mental states. Another influential author has been Stephen Stich. His important 1983 book, From Folk Psychology to Cognitive Science: The Case Against Belief, argues that even conventional computational psychology -- which is often assumed to vindicate common-sense psychology -- should reject taxonomies for cognitive states the correspond with belif-desire psychology. These authors' views are discussed in more detail in Sections 3 and 4 below.
If someone has the desire for X and the belief that the best way to get X is by doing Y, then (barring certain conditions) that person will tend to do Y.
Advocates of the theory-theory claim that generalizations like these function in folk psychology much like the laws and generalizations of scientific theories. At the same time, many theory-theorists allow that the laws of folk psychology are learned more informally than scientific theories, as part of our normal development (see, for example, P. M. Churchland, 1981 and Lewis, 1972).
According to theory-theorists, the posits of folk psychology are simply the mental states that figure in our everyday psychological explanations. Theory-theorists maintain the (controversial) position that, as theoretical posits, these states are not directly observed, though they are thought to account for observable effects like overt behavior. Theory-theorists also claim that common-sense assigns a number of properties to these states, such as causal, semantic and qualitative features. For instance, the theory-theory claims common-sense assigns two sorts of properties to beliefs. First, there are various causal properties. Beliefs are the sort of states that are caused in certain specific circumstances, interact with other cognitive states in various ways, and come to generate various sorts of behavior, depending on the agent's other desires and mental states. As functionalists have claimed, these causal roles appear to define our ordinary notion of belief and distinguish them from other types of mental states. Second, beliefs have intentionality; that is, they are each express a proposition or are about a particular state of affairs. This inherent intentionality (also called "meaning", "content", and "semantic character"), is commonly regarded as something special about beliefs and other propositional attitudes. Moreover, as we will see below, it is also a popular target of eliminative materialists who challenge the propriety and explanatory value of beliefs.
To see this a little better, it will help to return to the important distinction made by Steven Savitt discussed in Section 2 between ontologically conservative (or retentive) theory change on the one hand, and ontologically radical (or eliminative) theory change on the other hand. Ontologically conservative theory change occurs when the entities and posits of the replaced theory are relocated, often with some degree of revision, in the replacing theory. For example, as our theory of light was gradually replaced by our understanding of electro-magnetic radiation, our conception of light was dramatically transformed as we recognized ways in which are old conception was mistaken or incomplete. Nevertheless, at no point did we come to say that there is really no such thing as light. Rather, light was eventually identified with a form of electro-magnetic radiation.
By contrast, our notion of demons did not come to find a new home in contemporary theories of mental disorder. There is nothing in the theories of schizophrenia, Tourette's Syndrome, neuro-pathology or any of the other modern explanations for bizarre behavior, that we can sensibly identify with malevolent spirits with supernatural powers. The notion of a demon is just too far removed from anything we now posit to explain behavior that once explained by demonology. Consequently, the transition from demonology to modern accounts of this behavior was ontologically radical. We dropped demons from our current ontology, and came to realize that the notion is empty -- it refers to nothing real.
Eliminative materialists claim that an ontologically radical theory change of this sort awaits the theoretical posits of folk psychology. Just as we came to understand that there are no such things as demons (because nothing at all like demons appear in modern accounts of strange behavior), so too, eliminative materialists argue that various folk psychological concepts -- like our concept of belief -- will eventually be recognized as empty posits that fail to correspond with anything that actually exists. Since there simply is nothing that have the causal and semantic properties we attribute to beliefs (and many other mental states) it will turn out that there really are no such things.
A somewhat similar framework for understanding eliminative materialism is provided by David Lewis's discussion of functional definitions in psychology (1972). In Lewis's account, our commonsense mental notions can be treated as functionally defined theoretical terms that appear in a chain of Ramsey-sentences. The Ramsey-sentences are a formal reconstruction of the platitudes of commonsense psychology. They provide a set of roles or conditions that more or less must be met for the instantiation of any given state. If nothing comes close to actually filling the roles specified by this framework for a certain state, then we are warranted in saying that the theoretical posit in question doesn't refer and there is no such thing. Eliminative materialists claim that this is precisely what will happen with at least some of our folk mental notions.
These general theoretical arguments do not seem to have significantly undermined the intuitive support that folk psychology enjoys. In response to the charge that folk psychology is stagnant, many have argued that this assessment is unfair, and that folk psychology has actually stimulated a number of fruitful research programs in scientific psychology (Greenwood, 1991; Horgan and Woodward, 1985). Moreover, defenders of folk psychology note that it hardly follows from the observation that a given theory is incomplete, or fails to explain everything, that it is therefore radically false (Horgan and Woodward, 1985). Defenders of folk psychology object that these theoretical considerations cannot outweigh the evidence provided by everyday, ordinary experience of our own minds, such as our introspective experience, which seems to vividly support the reality of mental states like beliefs.
Regarding this last point, eliminativists like the Churchlands warn that we should be deeply suspicious about the reliability of introspective "evidence" about the inner workings of the mind. If inner observation is as theory-laden as many now suppose outer perception to be, what we introspect may be largely determined by our folk psychological framework. In other words, "introspecting" beliefs may be just like people "seeing" demonic spirits or celestial spheres (Churchland, P.M., 1988). This skepticism about the reliability of introspection is bolstered by empirical work that calls into question the reliability of introspection (Nisbett and Wilson, 1977).
In response to this line of reasoning, many have argued that it is mistake to treat folk psychology as committed to a quasi-linguistic structure to propositional attitudes (Horgan and Graham, 1991; Dennett, 1991). And even for those who find this reading of folk psychology plausible, there is a further difficulty regarding the relevance of neuroscience for determining the status of folk psychology. Some, such as Zenon Pylyshyn (1984), have insisted that just as the physical circuitry of a computer is the wrong level of analysis to look for computational symbol structures, so too, the detailed neurological wiring of the brain is the wrong level of organization to look for structures that might qualify as beliefs. Instead, if we view the mind as the brain's program, as many advocates of classical AI do, then folk posits exist at a level of analysis that is more abstract than the neuro-physical details. Consequently, many realists about the posits of folk psychology discount the importance of any apparent mis-match between neurological architecture and the alleged linguistic form of propositional attitudes (Fodor & Pylyshyn, 1988; McLaughlin & Warfield, 1994).
Yet, as Stich himself notes, even if it should turn out that folk posits do not belong in a scientific psychology, more is needed to establish that they do not actually exist. After all, we do not doubt the existence of several sorts of things (e.g., chairs, articles of clothing) that are defined in ways that make them ill-suited for science. If our best scientific account posited states that share many features with beliefs, such as similar causal roles, then even if the two taxonomies pulled apart in certain cases, we may still regard folk psychology as, in some sense, vindicated. While the scientific taxonomy may not list beliefs as basic cognitive states, it could conceivably still provide the resources for developing a realist interpretation of these and other folk psychological states.
Ramsey, Stich and Garon's argument assumes that in highly distributed networks, it is impossible to specify the semantic content of elements of the network that are causally responsible for various cognitive episodes. Some have responded to their argument by suggesting that, with highly sophisticated forms of analysis, it actually is possible to pick out causally relevant pieces of stored information (Forster and Saidel, 1994). Others have argued that, like the Churchlands, Ramsey, Stich and Garon have offered a mistaken interpretation of folk psychology, suggesting it requires far less in the way of explicit, discrete structures than they suggest (Dennett, 1991; Heil, 1991). This is a common criticism of eliminative materialism, and we will look at it more closely in the next section.
In another article, "Quining Qualia" (1988), Dennett again calls into question apparently essential features of qualia, including their inherent subjectivity and their private nature. Dennett discusses several cases -- both actual and imaginary -- to expose ways in which these ordinary intuitions about qualia pull apart. In so doing, Dennett suggests our qualia concepts are fundamentally confused and fail to correspond with the actual inner workings of our cognitive system.
Some writers have suggested an eliminativist outlook not just with regard to particular states of consciousness, but with regard to phenomenal consciousness itself. For example, Georges Rey (1983, 1988) has argued that if we look at the various neurological or cognitive theories of what consciousness might amount to, such as internal monitoring or the possession of second-order representational states, it seems easy to imagine all of these features incorporated in a computational device that lacks anything we intuitively think of as "real" or robust consciousness. Rey suggests that the failure of these accounts to capture our ordinary notion of consciousness may be because the latter corresponds with no actual process or phenomenon; the "inner light" we associate with consciousness may be nothing more than a remnant of misguided Cartesian intuitions (see also Wilkes, 1988; 1995).
Many writers have argued that eliminative materialism is in some sense self-refuting (Baker, 1987; Boghossian, 1990, 1991; Reppert, 1992). A common way this charge is made is to insist that a capacity or activity that is somehow invoked by the eliminativist is itself something that requires the existence of beliefs. One popular candidate for this activity is the making of an assertion. The critic insists that to assert something one must believe it. Hence, for eliminative materialism to be asserted as a thesis, the eliminativist herself must believe that it is true. But if the eliminativist has such a belief, then there are beliefs and eliminativism is thereby proven false.
Eliminativists often respond to this objection by first noting that the bare thesis that there are no beliefs is not itself contradictory or conceptually incoherent. So properly understood, the complaint is not that eliminative materialism (qua-proposition) is self-refuting. Rather, it is that the eliminativist herself is doing something that disconfirms her own thesis. In the above example, the disconfirming act is the making of an assertion, as it is alleged by the critic that we must believe anything we assert with public language. However, this last claim is precisely the sort of folk-psychological assumption that the eliminative materialist is suggesting we should abandon. According to eliminative materialism, all of the various capacities that we now explain by appealing to beliefs do not actually involve beliefs at all. So the eliminativist will hold that the self-refutation critics beg the question against eliminative materialism. To run this sort of objection, the critic endorses some principle about the necessity of beliefs which itself presupposes that eliminative materialism must be false (P. S. Churchland, 1986; Cling, 1989; Devitt, 1990, 1991; Ramsey, 1991)
In section 2, we saw that eliminative materialism typically rests upon a particular understanding of the nature of folk psychology. The next criticism of eliminative materialism challenges the various characterizations of folk psychology provided by its advocates -- in particular the view set forth by advocates of the theory-theory. This criticism comes from two very distinct traditions. The first tradition is at least partly due to the writings of Wittgenstein (1953) and Ryle (1949), and insists that (contra many eliminativists) common sense psychology does not treat mental states like beliefs as discrete inner causes of behavior (Bogdan, 1991; Haldane, 1988; Wilkes, 1993). What folk psychology actually does treat beliefs and desires as is much less clear in this tradition. One perspective (Dennett, 1987) is that propositional attitudes are actually dispositional states that we use to adopt a certain heuristic stance toward rational agents. According to this view, our talk about mental states should be interpreted as talk about abstracta that, although real, are not candidates for straightforward reduction or elimination as the result of cognitive science research. Moreover, since beliefs and other mental states are used for so many things besides the explanation of human behavior, it is far from clear that our explanatory theories about inner workings of the mind/brain have much relevance for their actual status.
The second perspective criticizing the theory-theory is based on research in contemporary cognitive science, and stems from a different model of the nature of our explanatory and predictive practices (Gordon, 1986, 1992; Goldman, 1992). Known as the "simulation theory", this alternative model holds that we predict and explain behavior not by using a theory, but by instead running an off-line simulation of how we would act in a comparable situation. That is, according to this picture, we disconnect our own decision-making sub-system and then feed it pretend beliefs and desires (and perhaps other relevant data) that we assume the agent whose behavior we are trying to predict is likely to possess. This allows us to generate both predictions and explanations of others by simply employing cognitive machinery that we already possess. In effect, the simulation theory claims that our reasoning about the minds and behavior of others is not significantly different from putting ourselves in their shoes. Thus, no full-blown theory of the mind is ever needed. Simulations theorists claim that, contrary to the assumptions of eliminative materialism, no theory of the mind exists that could one day prove false.
Both sides of this debate between the theory-theory and the simulation theory have used empirical work from developmental psychology to support their case (Stich and Nichols, 1992; Gordon, 1992). For example, theory-theorists have noted that developmental psychologists like Henry Wellman and Alison Gopnik have used various findings to suggest that children go through phases that are analogous to the phases one would go through when acquiring a theory (Gopnik and Wellman, 1992). Moreover, children appear to ascribe beliefs to themselves in the same way they ascribe beliefs to others. Theory-theorists have used considerations such as these to support their claim that our notion of belief is employed as the posit of a folk theory rather than input to a simulation model. At the same time, simulation theorists have employed the finding that 3-year-olds struggle with false belief ascriptions to suggest that children are actually ascribing their own knowledge to others, something that might be expected on the simulation account (Gordon, 1986).
A common eliminativist response to this argument is to re-emphasize a lesson from the philosophy of science; namely, that any theory -- especially one that is as near and dear to us as folk psychology -- can often appear successful even when it completely misrepresents reality. History demonstrates that we often discount anomalies, ignore failures as insignificant, and generally attribute more success to a popular theory than it deserves. Like the proponents of vitalism or phlogiston theory, we may be blind to the failings of folk psychology until an alternative account is in hand (P. M. Churchland, 1981; P. S. Churchland, 1986).
While many defenders of folk psychology insist that folk psychology is explanatorily strong, some defenders have gone in the opposite direction, arguing that it is committed to far less than eliminativists have typically assumed (Horgan, 1993; Horgan and Graham, 1991; Jackson and Pettit, 1990). According to these writers, folk pscyhology, while indeed a theory, is a relatively "austere" (i.e., ontologically non-committal) theory, and requires very little for vindication. Consequently, these authors conclude that when properly described, folk psychology can be seen as compatible with a very wide range of neuroscientific or cognitive developments.
Of course, some claim that these concerns are quite premature, given the promissory nature of eliminative materialism. After all, a pivotal component of the eliminativist perspective is the idea that the correct theory of the mind, once discovered by psychologists, will not reveal a system or structure that includes anything like common-sense mental states. Thus, for eliminative materialism to get off the ground, we have to assume that scientific psychology is going to turn out a certain way. But why suppose that before scientific psychology gets there? What is the point of drawing such a drastic conclusion about the nature of mentality, when a central premise needed for that conclusion is a long ways from being known?
One response an eliminativist might offer here would be to consider the broader theoretical roles eliminative materialism can play in our quest for a successful theory of the mind. Various writers have stipulated necessary conditions that any theory of the mind must meet, and on some accounts these conditions include the explication of various mental states as understood by common sense. According to this view, if a theory doesn't include states that correspond with beliefs, or provide us with some sort of account of the nature of consciousness, then it needn't be taken seriously as a complete account of "real" mental phenomena. One virtue of eliminative materialism is that it liberates our theorizing from this restrictive perspective. Thus, the relationship between eliminaitive materialism and science may be more reciprocal than many have assumed. While it is true that eliminative materialism depends upon the development of a radical scientific theory of the mind, it also appears that radical theorizing about the mind may itself rest upon our taking seriously the possibility that our common sense perspective may be profoundly mistaken.
| William Ramsey wramsey@nd.edu |