| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
1. Let
I be an interpretation function with respect to a
model, so that I(a) is the individual
I assigns to the individual constant
‘a’,
I(Fn) is the
n-place relation that I assigns to
n-place predicate Fn. Then for
all n-place predicates
‘Fn’ and individuals constants
‘c1’, ...,
‘cn’, the sentence
‘Fnc1...cn’
is true in the interpretation just in case <
I(c1), ...,
I(cn)>
ext(I(Fn)). We
would relativize this clause to variable assignments in the usual way
to define satisfaction conditions for atomic sentences.
2. More
generally, if
is a formula with free occurrences of exactly the
variables v1, ..., vn, then
‘[
v1,...,
vn
]’
is an n-place complex predicate (normal quotation marks are
used here as stand-ins for quasi-quotation). In more complicated
applications we could allow
to contain no free
variables (in which case
‘[
]’ denotes the
proposition that-
) or more free variables
than are bound by the
-operator (to allow
expressions like
‘[
x Fxyz]’, which we could
quantify into, as with
‘
y([
x Fxyz])’.
3. A standard sort of
comprehension schema
holds that for each open formula
,
Xn
x1...
xn(Xnx1...xn
if and only if
).
| Chris Swoyer cswoyer@ou.edu |