This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

version
history

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

A | B | C | D | E | F | G | H | I | J | K | L | M | N | O | P | Q | R | S | T | U | V | W | X | Y | Z

This document uses HTML 4/Unicode to display special characters. Older browsers and/or operating systems may not display these characters correctly.

last substantive
content change

APR
17
2001

Snarks

Snarks are a species of bandersnatch. They are thought to have evolved from the slithy toves along with the other bandersnatches. Snarks were common in New England forests until the late 19th century, when it was thought that they were hunted to extinction. Recent ethological expeditions, however, have uncovered evidence that there may be a few extant individuals. Snarks are favorites with animal lovers everywhere because in the spring, they gyre and gimble on small ponds in a brilliant mating display. In reference works on bandersnatches, snarks are referred to collectively by the Latin name Snarkidae.

Evolutionary History and Adaptive Features
Mating Display
Bibliography
Other Internet Resources
Related Entries

Evolutionary History and Adaptive Features

Snarks are a species of bandersnatch and are thought to have evolved from the slithy toves along with the other bandersnatches. Snarks evolved in the Devonian period and successfully adapted themselves in several ecological niches until the late 19th century. The fact that they have a dorsal sigmoid bone establishes their descent from the slithy toves.

Snarks bear young just at the point in early summer when their food source is most abundant. Their biological clocks are very well tuned and biologists study them as the principal model of such clocks in the animal kingdom.

Mating Display

There is nothing like the wonder and pageantry of snarks in mating season, as they gyre and gimble on the ponds of New England forests.

Bibliography

Doe, J., "The Ecological Range of the Snark," Ecology Today 3/1 (January 1992): 15-30
Dodgson, C., "The Origins of Bandersnatches," Annals of the Society for the Investigation of the Descendants of the Slithy Toves XL (1993): 1-20

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

Charles Dodgson
dodgson@alice.uwonderland.e du

A | B | C | D | E | F | G | H | I | J | K | L | M | N | O | P | Q | R | S | T | U | V | W | X | Y | Z