Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Relevance Logic

The Logic S

Here is a Hilbert-style axiomatisation of the logic S (for “syllogism”).

Our language contains propositional variables, parentheses and one connective: implication.

Axiom Scheme Axiom Name
1. (B→C) →((A→B) →(A→C)) Prefixing
2. (A→B) →((B→C) →(A→C)) Suffixing

Rule Name
A → B, B → C ⊢ A → C Transitivity
A → B ⊢ (B → C) → (A → C) Rule Suffixing
B → C ⊢ (A → B) → (A → C) Rule Prefixing

The logic T-W is S with the addition of the identity axiom (A→A). Martin's theorem is that no instance of the identity axiom is a theorem of S. It is a corollary of Martin's theorem that in T-W if both A→B and B→A are provable, then A and B are the same formula (see Anderson, Belnap, and Dunn (1992) §66).