Supplement to The Problem of Evil
The Validity of the Argument
That the argument is deductively valid can be seen as follows. First, let us introduce the following abbreviations:
- State(x): x is a state of affairs
- Dying(x): x is a state of affairs in which an animal dies an agonizing death in a forest fire
- Suffering(x): x is a state of affairs in which a child undergoes lingering suffering and eventual death due to cancer
- Bad(x): x is intrinsically bad or undesirable
- Omnipotent(x): x is omnipotent
- Omniscient(x): x is omniscient
- MorallyPerfect(x): x is morally perfect
- PreventsExistence(x,y): x prevents the existence y
- God(x): x is God
- HasPowerToPreventWithout(x,y): x has the power to prevent the existence of y without hereby either allowing an equal or greater evil, or preventing an equal or greater good
The argument just set out can then be formulated as follows:
| (1) | ∃x[State(x)
∧
(Dying(x)
∨
Suffering(x))
∧
Bad(x)
∧
∀y(Omnipotent(y) → HasPowerToPreventWithout(y,x))] |
|
| (2) | ∀x[State(x) → ∀z¬PreventsExistence(z,x)] | |
| (3) | ∀x∀y[(Bad(x)
∧
HasPowerToPreventWithout(y,x)
∧
¬PreventsExistence(y,x))
→
¬(Omniscient(y) ∧ MorallyPerfect(y))] |
Therefore, from (1), (2), and (3),
| (4) | ∀x¬[Omnipotent(x) ∧ Omniscient(x) ∧ MorallyPerfect(x)] | |
| (5) | ∀x[God(x) → (Omnipotent(x) ∧ Omniscient(x) ∧ MorallyPerfect(x))] |
Therefore,
| (6) | ¬∃x(God(x)) |
The premises here are (1), (2), (3), and (5), and they can be shown to entail the conclusion, (6), as follows.
The Inference from (1), (2), and (3) to (4)
| (i) | State(A) ∧ (Dying(A) ∨ Suffering(A)) ∧ Bad(A) ∧ ∀y(Omnipotent(y) → HasPowerToPreventWithout(y,A)) | From (1), via EE (Existential Elimination). |
| (ii) | ∀z¬PreventsExistence(z,A) | From (2) and 1st conjunct of (i) by UE and MP. |
| (iii) | Omnipotent(G) | Assumption for conditional proof ("G" arbitrary) |
| (iv) | HasPowerToPreventWithout(G,A) | From 4th conjunct of (i), by instantiating "G" and using MP |
| (v) | ¬PreventsExistence(G,A) | From (ii), by UE. |
| (vi) | Bad(A) ∧ HasPowerToPreventWithout(G,A) ∧ ¬PreventsExistence(G,A)) | Conjoin 3rd conjunct of (i) with (iv) and (v). |
| (vii) | ¬(Omniscient(y) ∧ MorallyPerfect(G)) | From (3) and (6), by UE and MP. |
| (viii) | Omnipotent(G) → ¬(Omniscient(G) ∧ MorallyPerfect(G)) | Conditional Proof, (iii) -- (vii). |
| (ix) | ¬(Omnipotent(G) ∧ Omniscient(G) ∧ MorallyPerfect(G)) | From (viii), by the equivalence of A→B with ¬(A∧¬B), double negation elimination, and associativity of conjunctions. |
| (x) | ∀x¬(Omnipotent(x) ∧ Omniscient(x) ∧ MorallyPerfect(x)) | From (ix), via UI (Universal Introduction), since ‘G’ was arbitrary. |
The Inference from (4) and (5) to (6)
| (i) | ¬[Omnipotent(G) ∧ Omniscient(G) ∧ MorallyPerfect(G)] | From (4), via universal insantiation, and where ‘G’ is arbitrary. |
| (ii) | God(G) → (Omnipotent(G) ∧ Omniscient(G) ∧ MorallyPerfect(G)) | From (5) by universal instantiation. |
| (iii) | ¬God(G) | From (i) and (ii) by modus tollens |
| (iv) | ∀x¬(God(x) | From (iii) by universal generalization, since ‘G’ was arbitrary. |
| (v) | ¬∃x(God(x)) | From (iv), by interdefinability of quantifiers. |