Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.5

Proposition 2.5.
ω ∈ KmN(A) iff
(1) For all agents i1, i2, … , imN, ω ∈ Ki1Ki2Kim(A)

Hence, ω ∈ K*N(A) iff (1) is the case for each m ≥ 1.

Proof.
Note first that

(2)      

i1N
Ki1 (  

i2N
Ki2 ((  

im−1N
Kim−1 (  

imN
Kim(A) ) ) ) )

      =    

i1N
Ki1 (  

i2N
Ki2 ((  

im−1N
Kim−1(K1N(A))) ) )

      =    

i1N
Ki1 (  

i2N
Ki2(  

im−2N
Kim−2(K2N(A)) ) )

      = …

      =    

i1N
Ki1(Km−1N(A))

      =   KmN(A)

By (2),

KmN(A) ⊆ Ki1Ki2Kim(A)

for i1, i2, …, imN, so if ω ∈ KmN(A) then condition (1) is satisfied. Condition (1) is equivalent to

ω ∈  

i1N
Ki1 (  

i2N
Ki2 ((  

im−1N
Kim−1 (  

imN
Kim(A) ) ) ) )

so by (2), if (1) is satisfied then ω ∈ KmN(A). □

Return to Common Knowledge

Copyright © 2022 by
Peter Vanderschraaf
Giacomo Sillari <gsillari@luiss.it>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free