Libertarianism

First published Thu Sep 5, 2002; substantive revision Tue Jul 1, 2014

In the most general sense, libertarianism is a political philosophy that affirms the rights of individuals to liberty, to acquire, keep, and exchange their holdings, and considers the protection of individual rights the primary role for the state. This entry is on libertarianism in the narrower sense of the moral view that agents initially fully own themselves and have certain moral powers to acquire property rights in external things. For excellent discussion of the liberty tradition more generally (including classical liberalism), see Gaus and Mack (2004), Barnett (2004), and Brennan (2012).

Libertarianism can be understood as a basic moral principle or as a derivative one. This entry will focus on libertarianism as a basic natural rights doctrine, in the spirit of Locke (1690) and Nozick (1974). It will not address instrumental derivations, such as those on the basis of rule consequentialism or teleology (e.g., Epstein 1995, 1998; Rasmussen and Den Uyl 2005; or Shapiro 2007), rule contractarianism (e.g., Narveson 1988 and roughly Lomasky 1987), public reason (e.g., Gaus 2012), or Rawlsian arguments (e.g., Tomasi 2012). Instrumental derivations of libertarianism appeal to considerations such as human limitations (e.g., of knowledge and motivation), incentive effects, administrative costs, and the intrinsic value of liberty for the good life. This entry will simply address the plausibility of libertarian principles in their own right.

Libertarianism is sometimes identified with the principle that each agent has a right to maximum equal empirical negative liberty, where empirical negative liberty is the absence of forcible interference from other agents when one attempts to do things (see, for example, Narveson 1988, 2000; Steiner 1994; and Narveson and Sterba 2010). This is sometimes called “Spencerian Libertarianism” (after Herbert Spencer). It is usually claimed that this view is equivalent to the above “self-ownership” version of libertarianism. Kagan (1994), however, has cogently argued that the former (depending on the interpretation) either leads to radical pacifism (the use of force is never permissible) or is compatible with a wide range of views in addition to the above “self-ownership” libertarianism. We shall not, however, attempt to assess this issue here. Instead, we shall simply focus on the above “self-ownership” version of libertarianism.

Although libertarianism could be advocated as a full theory of moral permissibility, it is almost always advocated as a theory of justice in at least one of two senses. In one sense, justice is concerned with the moral duties that we owe others. It does not address impersonal duties (duties owed to no one) or duties owed to self. In a second sense, justice is concerned with the morally enforceable duties that we have. It does not address duties for which it is impermissible to use force to ensure compliance or to rectify (e.g., punish) non-compliance (e.g., a duty to see your mother on her birthday). We shall here consider libertarianism as a theory of justice in each sense.

A central attraction of libertarian political philosophy is that it takes very seriously the historical component of justice. To ask whether justice obtains in the world, libertarians argue, is mainly to ask whether people have been justly treated, principally whether their rights to their persons and possessions have been respected. Libertarian theories of justice thus focus on the processes by which social results come about, and reject theories that look merely at the outcomes or end-state distributions. The most famous version of this, no doubt, is Robert Nozick's (1974) “entitlement theory”, which holds that distributive justice primarily consists of only three principles: (1) the principle of justice in acquisition, (2) the principle of justice in transfer, and (3) the principle of rectification for violations of (1) and (2).

Perhaps as a result of Nozick's fame, libertarianism is often thought of as “right-wing” doctrine. This, however, is mistaken for at least two reasons. First, on social—rather than economic—issues, libertarianism tends to be “left-wing”. It opposes laws that restrict consensual and private sexual relationships between adults (e.g., gay sex, extra-marital sex, and deviant sex), laws that restrict drug use, laws that impose religious views or practices on individuals, and compulsory military service. Second, in addition to the better-known version of libertarianism—right-libertarianism—there is also a version known as “left-libertarianism”. Both endorse full self-ownership, but they differ with respect to the powers agents have to appropriate unowned natural resources (land, air, water, minerals, etc.). Right-libertarianism holds that typically such resources may be appropriated, for example, by the first person who discovers them, mixes her labor with them, or merely claims them—without the consent of others, and with little or no payment to them. Left-libertarianism, by contrast, holds that unappropriated natural resources belong to everyone in some egalitarian manner. It can, for example, require those who claim rights over natural resources to make a payment to others for the value of those rights. This can provide the basis for a kind of egalitarian redistribution.

1. Self-Ownership

Libertarianism, in the narrow sense of this entry, holds that agents are, at least initially, full self-owners. Agents are (moral) full self-owners just in case they morally own themselves in just the same way that they can morally fully own inanimate objects. Below we shall distinguish between full (interpersonal) self-ownership and full political self-ownership. Many versions of libertarianism endorse only the latter.

Full ownership of an entity consists of a full set of the following ownership rights: (1) control rights over the use of the entity: both a liberty-right to use it and a claim-right that others not use it, (2) rights to compensation if someone uses the entity without one's permission, (3) enforcement rights (e.g., rights of prior restraint if someone is about to violate these rights), (4) rights to transfer these rights to others (by sale, rental, gift, or loan), and (5) immunities to the non-consensual loss of these rights. Full ownership is simply a logically strongest set of ownership rights over a thing. There is some indeterminacy in this notion (since there can be more than one strongest set of such rights), but there is a determinate core set of rights (see below).

At the core of full self-ownership, then, is full control self-ownership, the full right to control the use of one's person. Something like control self-ownership is arguably needed to recognize the fact there are some things (e.g., various forms of physical contact) that may not be done to a person without her consent, but which may be done with that consent. It wrongs an individual to subject her to non-consensual and unprovoked killing, maiming, enslavement, or forcible manipulation.

Full-self ownership is sometimes thought to guarantee that the agent has a certain basic liberty of action, but this is not so. For if the rest of the world (natural resources and artifacts) is fully (“maximally”) owned by others, one is not permitted to do anything without their consent—since that would involve the use of their property. For example, as a result of one's trespass on their land, one may become their slave. The protection that self-ownership affords is a basic protection against others doing certain things to one, but not a guarantee of liberty. Even this protection, however, may be merely formal. A plausible thesis of self-ownership must allow that some rights (e.g., against imprisonment) may be lost if one violates the rights of others. Hence, if the rest of world is owned by others, then anything one does without their consent violates their property rights, and, as a result of such violations, one may lose some or all of one's rights of self-ownership. This point shows that, because agents must use natural resources (occupy space, breathe air, etc.), self-ownership on its own has no substantive implications. It is only when combined with assumptions about how the rest of the world is owned (and the consequences of violating those property rights) that substantive implications follow.

The principle of full self-ownership is attractive for many reasons. It is a strong endorsement of the moral importance and the sovereignty of the individual, it expresses the refusal to treat people as interchangeable objects (things that may be traded off for each other), and it seems to provide a clear and simple starting point for our thinking about justice. Nevertheless, the principle has turned out to be very controversial. Let us now consider two sets of important objections to full self-ownership.

The first set of objections points to a number of counter-intuitive implications of full self-ownership. One such objection is that it denies that individuals have an obligation to help others in need, except through voluntary agreement or prior wrongdoing. Those who advocate libertarianism as a theory of the duties owed to others typically endorse full (interpersonal) self-ownership and are subject to this objection. They reject any such obligation on the ground that it induces a form of partial slavery.

Those who advocate libertarianism as theory of enforceable duties, however, need not be subject to this objection. They can endorse full political self-ownership, without endorsing full (interpersonal) self-ownership. The two are the same except the former is silent about what duties one may owe to others and asserts instead that one has no enforceable duties to aid others, except those that arise from voluntary agreement and prior wrongdoing. Of course, many would still insist that we have non-voluntary enforceable duties to aid those in extreme need when we can do so at little cost to ourselves or others.

The remaining objections apply to both interpersonal and political self-ownership, and hence we shall cease distinguishing them.

A second objection also concerns situations in which individuals in extreme need can greatly benefit from the involvement of an agent. Instead, however, of addressing whether the agent owes the individual a duty, or has an enforceable duty, to aid her, the question is whether others may use the agent's person without her consent to aid those in need. For example, is it permissible to gently push an innocent agent to the ground in order to save ten innocent lives? Full self-ownership (of both sorts) asserts that it is not. The rough idea is that individuals are normatively separate and their person may not be used non-consensually for the benefit of others.

A third objection to full self-ownership is that it includes a right to make gifts of one's services, and that such gifts, when given from members of an older generation to members of a younger generation, can significantly disrupt the conditions of equality of opportunity. (Note that the right to make gifts of external things is not at issue here, since it does not follow from full self-ownership alone.) The right to make gifts of personal services can be defended by emphasizing how such gifts are an essential part of intimate personal relationships. Moreover, if a person has the right to perform an action for her own benefit, then she arguably also has the right to perform it for someone else's benefit. A possible reply here is that, although the donor may well have the power to make gifts of her services, the recipient may not have a right to the full benefit of those services (e.g., the benefits may not be immune to taxation).

A fourth objection to full self-ownership is that it permits voluntary enslavement. Agents have, it claims, not only the right to control the use of their person, but also the right to transfer that right (e.g., by sale or gift) to others. Some libertarians—such as Rothbard (1982) and Barnett (1998: 78–82)—deny that such transfer is even possible, since others cannot control one's will. This, however, may be a mistake if what is at issue is the moral right to control permissible use (by giving or denying permission), not the psychological capacity to control. Many authors—such as Locke (1690) and Grunebaum (1987)—deny that the rights over oneself are so transferable, typically on the ground that such transfers undermine one's autonomy. One might, however, reply that the right to exercise one's autonomy is more fundamental than the protection or promotion of one's autonomy. (For elaboration, see Vallentyne 1998. See also Steiner 1994.)

A fifth objection to full self-ownership is that it (like rights in general) can lead to inefficient outcomes. Where there are externalities or public goods (such as police protection), each person may be better off if some of each person's rights are infringed (e.g., if each person is required to provide service each week on a police patrol). Given the problems generated by prisoners' dilemmas and other kinds of market failure, in large societies it will typically be impossible to obtain everyone's consent to perform such services. Given the importance of such services, it is arguably permissible to force individuals to provide certain services (in violation of full self-ownership) as long as everyone benefits appropriately.

These objections indicate different ways in which full self-ownership has proven controversial. It is possible to weaken the principle along any of these dimensions to avoid the objections, while holding on to the general spirit of the self-ownership view. The result will not be a theory of full self-ownership, but one that approximates that idea.

A second set of objections is more theoretical in nature. These hold that, upon inspection, the idea of self-ownership is neither as simple nor as clear-cut as it initially appeared. One version of this objection points to the indeterminacy of the idea of ownership. Positive law recognizes a wide variety of ownership arrangements, including ones that consist of very different kinds of rights than the self-ownership theorist defends. So there may be no clear general notion of ownership to which one can appeal to defend self-ownership in particular. Instead, ownership claims may be conclusions of intricate moral (or legal) arguments (Fried 2004, 2005).

Another objection is that full self-ownership has very restrictive implications. Recognizing people's rights as full self-owners means condemning as wrongful even very minor infringements, such as when tiny bits of pollution fall upon an unconsenting person. Prohibiting all acts that can lead to such minor infringements poses an unacceptable limit to our liberty. But from the point of view of self-ownership, there is no principled difference between minor infringements and major infringements. Thus, this objection goes, self-ownership theory must be rejected. (Railton 2003, Sobel 2012)

For replies to some of these theoretical objections, see Vallentyne, Steiner, and Otsuka (2005).

2. The Power to Appropriate Natural Resources: Libertarianism, Left and Right

Libertarianism is committed to a strong version of the self-ownership thesis. According to many libertarians, the kind of reasoning behind this thesis also has implications for the moral status of the external world as well. On one such view, people can literally extend their claims of self-ownership to include other physical objects. The traditional Lockean argument holds that people who own their labor must also own the fruits of their labor, even if those include previously unowned objects.

Self-owners thus have moral powers to appropriate external objects, such as natural resources. A distinction can be made, however, between right-libertarianism and left-libertarianism, depending on the stance taken on how natural resources can be owned. (Throughout, we use “resource” in the weak sense of “stuff” in the world, with no assumption about whether it has any value to individuals. The term is often used in a more restrictive sense.)

Given that libertarianism conceives of distributive justice as primarily historical in nature, there are two places where constraints on legitimate holdings may be introduced: at the point of original appropriation or at the point of transfers (or both). Simply stated, a libertarian theory moves from “right” to “left” the more it insists on constraints aimed at preserving some kind of equality.

The maximally strong version of a constraint on original appropriation holds that initially no one has any liberty right to use, or any moral power to appropriate, natural resources. A radical version of joint-ownership left-libertarianism, for example, holds that individuals may use natural resources only with the collective consent (e.g., majority or unanimous) of the members of society. Given that all action requires the use of some natural resources (land, air, etc.), this leaves agents no freedom of action (except with the permission of others), and this is clearly implausible. A less radical version of joint-ownership left-libertarianism allows that agents may use natural resources, but holds that they have no moral power to appropriate natural resources without the collective consent of the members of society (e.g., Grunebaum 1987). Although this leaves agents a significant range of freedom of action, it leaves them little security in their plans of action. They have the security that others are not permitted to use their person (e.g., assault them) without their consent, but they have only limited security in their possessions of external things (except with the consent of others). Agents are permitted to cultivate and gather apples, but others are permitted to take them when this violates no rights of self-ownership (e.g., when they can simply take them from the collected pile).

Given the central importance of security of some external resources, it is implausible that agents have no power to appropriate without the consent of others. More specifically, it is most implausible to hold that the consent of others is required for appropriation when communication with others is impossible, extremely difficult, or expensive (as it almost always is). And even when communication is relatively easy and costless, there seems to be no good motivation for requiring the consent of others as long as one appropriates no more than one's fair share. Joint-ownership left-libertarianism is thus implausible.

A plausible account of liberty rights and powers of appropriation over natural resources must, we claim, be unilateralist in the sense that, under a broad range of conditions (1) agents are initially permitted to use natural resources without anyone's consent, and (2) agents initially have the power to appropriate (acquire rights over) natural resources without anyone's consent. This is just to say that initially natural resources are not protected by a property rule (which requires consent for permissible use or appropriation).

According to a unilateralist conception of the power to appropriate, agents who first claim rights over a natural resource acquire those rights—perhaps provided that certain other conditions are met. These additional conditions may include some kind of an interaction constraint (such as that the agent “mixed her labor” with the resource or that she was the first to discover the resource) and some kind of “fair share” constraint. In what follows, for simplicity, we shall ignore the interaction constraint and focus on the fair share constraint.

Consider, then, the maximally permissive view of original appropriation. Radical right libertarianism—advocated, for example, by Rothbard (1978, 1982), Narveson (1988: ch. 7; 1999), and Feser (2005)—holds that that there are no fair share constraints on use or appropriation.[1] Agents may appropriate, use, or even destroy whatever natural resources they want (as long as they violate no one's self-ownership). On this view, natural resources are initially not merely unprotected by a property rule (i.e., permissible use does not require anyone else's permission); they are also unprotected by a compensation liability rule (i.e., no compensation is owed if one uses). A main objection to this view is that no human agent created natural resources, and there is no reason that the person who first claims rights over a natural resource should reap an unfairly large or unequal share of the benefits that the resource provides. Another objection points out that appropriation without restrictions makes it possible that one person could own the entire world, thereby effectively putting the remaining propertyless persons in the problematic condition of requiring the owner's permission to do anything. Nor is there any reason to think the individuals are morally permitted to ruin natural resources as they please. Some sort of fair share condition restricts use and appropriation.

Plausible versions of libertarian theory must therefore attempt to strike some balance between the maximally restrictive and maximally permissive views. Consider Lockean libertarianism, which allows unilateral use and appropriation but insists on restrictions at both the stage of appropriation—in the form of the Lockean proviso that “enough and as good” be left for others—and subsequent possessions—because no one can exclude the needy from one's property. Lockean libertarianism views natural resources as initially unprotected by any property rule (no consent is needed for use or appropriation) but as protected by an ongoing compensation liability rule. Those who use natural resources, or claim rights over them, owe compensation to others for any wrongful costs imposed.

Nozickean right-libertarianism—advocated by Nozick (1974)—interprets the Lockean proviso as requiring that no individual be made worse off by the use or appropriation of a natural resource compared with non-use or non-appropriation.[2] One might object that this sets the compensation payment too low. It bases compensation on each person's reservation price, which is the lowest payment that would leave the individual indifferent with non-use or non-appropriation. Use or appropriation of natural resources typically brings significant benefits even after providing such compensation. There is little reason, one might argue, to hold that those who first use or claim rights over a natural resource should reap all the excess benefits that those resources provide.

Sufficientarian (centrist) libertarianism—such as something in the spirit of Simmons (1992, 1993) or Lomasky (1987)—interprets the Lockean proviso as requiring that others be left an adequate share of natural resources (on some conception of adequacy). There are different criteria that can be invoked for adequacy, but the most plausible ones are based on the quality of one's life prospects: enough for life prospects worth living, enough for basic subsistence life prospects, or enough for “minimally decent” life prospects. Depending on the nature of the world and the conception of adequacy, the sufficientarian proviso may be more, or less, demanding than the Nozickean proviso. If natural resources are sufficiently abundant relative to the individuals, then the Nozickean proviso will be more demanding (since many individuals would get more than an adequate share without the use or appropriation), but if natural resources are sufficiently scarce, then the sufficientarian proviso will be more demanding than the Nozickean one.

Although sufficientarian libertarianism may be more sensitive than Nozickean libertarianism to the quality of life prospects left to others, some libertarians, left-libertarians, argue that it nevertheless fails to recognize the extent to which natural resources belong to all of us in some egalitarian manner. Suppose that there are enough natural resources to give everyone fabulous life prospects, and someone appropriates (or uses) natural resources leaving others only minimally adequate life prospects and generating ultra-fabulous life-prospects for herself. Left-libertarians argue that it is implausible to hold that those who first use or claim a natural resource are entitled to reap significantly unequal benefits than others. Natural resources were not created by any human agent and their value, they argue, belongs to all of us in some egalitarian manner.

Let us now consider left-libertarianism. It holds that natural resources initially belong to everyone in some egalitarian manner, or that legitimate holdings are subject to some equality-preserving constraint over time.[3] We have already rejected one version—joint-ownership left-libertarianism—for failing to be unilateralist (i.e., because it requires the permission of others for use or appropriation of unowned natural resources). We shall now focus on Lockean (and hence unilateralist) versions of left-libertarianism.

Equal share left-libertarianism—advocated, for example, by Henry George (1879) and Hillel Steiner (1994)—interprets the Lockean proviso as requiring that one leave an equally valuable share of natural resources for others. Individuals are morally free to use or appropriate natural resources, but those who use or appropriate more than their per capita share owe others compensation for their excess share. This constraint applies not only at the point of appropriation (with subsequent holdings being altogether unconstrained), but must be respected through time.

Even equal share libertarianism, one might argue, is not sufficiently egalitarian. Although it requires that the competitive value of natural resources be distributed equally, it does nothing to offset disadvantages in unchosen internal endowments (e.g., the effects of genes or childhood environment). Equal share libertarianism is thus compatible with radically unequal life prospects.[4]

Consider, then, equal opportunity left-libertarianism advocated, for example, by Otsuka (2003).[5] It interprets the Lockean proviso as requiring that one leave enough for others to have an opportunity for well-being that is at least as good as the opportunity for well-being that one obtained in using or appropriating natural resources. Individuals who leave less than this are required to pay the full competitive value of their excess share to those deprived of their fair share. Unlike the equal share view, those whose initial internal endowments provide less favorable effective opportunities for well-being are entitled to larger shares of natural resources. Although this version of libertarianism is highly egalitarian, it limits the egalitarianism to the distribution of the value of the natural resources. Full self-ownership still places constraints on the promotion of equality: Individuals are not morally required to provide personal services or body parts merely because they have more valuable personal endowments.

3. Enforcement Rights: Prior Restraint and Rectification

So far, we have addressed the core libertarian rights of full self-ownership and the right to appropriate natural resources. A complete libertarian theory must also specify what enforcement rights individuals have when others violate their rights. The idea of full self-ownership does not include a full specification of enforcement rights. This is because the relevant idea is universal full self-ownership (i.e., every agent being a full self-owner), and this notion is indeterminate with respect to enforcement rights (as well as compensation rights). For a given individual, a maximal set of self-ownership rights would include both a full immunity against loss even if the agent violates the rights of others (and hence others would not be permitted to use non-consensual force against her ever) and maximal enforcement rights against others (which would permit the agent to use force against others in order to prevent their violation of her rights). This set of rights, however, is not universalizable. If one agent has the strong immunity to loss of rights, then other agents cannot have the strong enforcement rights (which require the offending agent to have lost some of her rights of self-ownership). Thus, full (universalizable) self-ownership can include no enforcement rights (but a full immunity to loss), or full enforcement rights (but no immunity to loss for rights violations), or anything in between (on the issue of indeterminacy, see Fried [2004, 2005] and Vallentyne, Steiner, and Otsuka [2005]).

One possible position is extreme pacifism, according to which individuals are never permitted to use non-consensual force against others. Another is moderate pacifism, according to which individuals are permitted to use non-consensual force against others only when necessary in self-defense (or the defense of others). This moderate view would allow the use of force against a person to prevent her from wrongfully using force against others, but it would not allow the use of force to rectify past violations (e.g., punish or extract compensation from the rights-violator). Most libertarian positions would allow the use of force for cases of rectification. Many would allow the use of force for retributive punishment, but some—Barnett (1998), for example—reject retributive punishment and insist that compensation for wrongful harms is the sole justification for the rectificatory use of force.

4. Anarchism and the Minimal State

Libertarianism requires that states, like all agents, respect the moral rights of individuals, including their rights over their persons and their legitimate possessions. All modern states, including the welfare state, fail to meet this standard. Thus, many of the powers of the modern state are deemed morally illegitimate.

The main reason for the illegitimacy of modern states is that they employ forceful means in cases where such force is impermissible. Agents of the state violate the rights of citizens when they punish, or threaten to punish, a person for riding a motorcycle without a helmet, for taking drugs, for refusing to purchase health insurance or serve in the military, for engaging in consensual sexual relations in private, or for gambling. Furthermore, agents of the state violate the rights of citizens when they force, or threaten to force, individuals to transfer their legitimately held wealth to the state in order to bail out large companies, provide for pensions, to help the needy, or to pay for public goods (e.g., parks or roads). (All libertarians object to such transfers to the extent that these are in excess of what is owed for the appropriation of natural resources.) Some libertarian-leaning theorists—such as Hayek (1960)—argue that it is legitimate to force people to pay their fair share of the costs of providing basic police services (i.e., protection of the libertarian rights and prosecution of those who violate them), but it's hard to see how this could be legitimate on libertarian grounds. If one does not voluntarily agree to share one's wealth in this way, the mere fact that one reaps a benefit from the services does not, on libertarian grounds, generate an enforceable duty to pay one's fair share.[6]

A second, more radical objection libertarians raise against the modern state is that it uses force, or the threat thereof, to restrict people's freedom to use force to protect and enforce their own rights. Although most states recognize a right to use force in self-defense, few states recognize a legal right to forcibly extract compensation from, or punish, a person who has violated one's rights. States typically punish those who attempt to impose the relevant rectification—even if the private citizens impose the very same rectification that the state would impose. Non-pacifist libertarians, however, deny this. Each individual has the right to enforce his rights in various ways, and these are not lost unless the individual voluntarily gives them up. The objection here, then, is not that agents of the state enforce people's rights (which they are perfectly entitled to do if the protected person so wishes), but rather that the state uses force to prevent citizens from directly enforcing their own rights.

The above objections to the modern welfare state would be made both by right-libertarians and left-libertarians. Left-libertarians, however, can endorse certain “state-like” activities that right-libertarians reject. For on most left-libertarian views, individuals have an enforceable duty to pay others for the value of the rights that they claim over natural resources. Individuals seeking economic justice could form organizations that, under certain conditions, could force individuals to give them the payment they owe for their rights over natural resources, and could then transfer the payments to the individuals who are owed payments (after deducting a fee for the service, if the person agrees). The organization could also provide various public goods such as basic police services, national defense, roads, parks, and so on. By providing such public goods, the value of the rights claimed over natural resources by individuals will increase (e.g., rights over land for which police protection is provided are more valuable than rights over that land without police protection). Such public goods could be provided when and only when they would be self-financing based on the increased rents that they generate.

Such “justice-promoting” organizations engage in many of the activities of the modern states, and left-libertarianism can accept the legitimacy of such activities. There are, however, three important qualifications. First, organizational activities are limited to enforcing people's libertarian rights and to enhancing people's opportunities by providing public goods. Force is never used to restrict activities that violate no libertarian rights. Second, no monopoly on such activities is claimed. There may be many organizations providing such services. Third and finally, the agents of the organization are permitted to use force to make an individual make her payment for the value of rights over natural resources only if such use is, in some suitable sense, the most reliable way of ensuring that she discharges her duty. Corrupt or inefficient organizations are not permitted to use force to collect such payments. Furthermore, even honest and efficient organizations are not so permitted when the individual owing the payment will voluntarily make the payment directly to the relevant parties (for elaboration, see Vallentyne 2007).

Libertarianism, then, is not only critical of the modern welfare state, but of states in general. Given that so much of modern life seems to require a state, libertarianism's anarchist stance is a powerful objection against it. In reply, libertarians typically offer at least the following three rejoinders. (1) Many of the effects of states are quite negative. (2) Many of the positive effects that states can bring about can also be obtained without the state through voluntary mechanisms. Thus, libertarians tend to be more hopeful about the possibility of anarchic provision of order, public goods, as well as charitable giving. And (3) state violence, and the accompanying violations of people's rights, are among the most serious moral issues. Thus, even if some positive effects cannot be so obtained, the ends do not justify the means in these cases. (For a thorough discussion, see Huemer 2012, or Chartier 2012.)

5. Some Ancillary Issues

5.1 Non-Autonomous Sentient Beings

Libertarianism asserts that each autonomous agent initially fully owns herself and that agents have moral powers to acquire property rights in natural resources and artifacts. What is the status of non-autonomous beings—such as children and many animals—that have moral standing (e.g., because sentient)? One possible reply is to deny that there are any non-autonomous beings with moral standing (e.g., because only beings capable of having moral duties—agents—are owed any duties). Non-autonomous beings are simply things to be used. As such, they can be the full private property of agents. Few people, however, will accept that position. Children are not the full private property of their parents. Dogs may not be tortured for fun. Another possibility is to hold that non-autonomous sentient beings are also full self-owners, where the rights involved are understood as protecting their interests rather than their choices (see, for example, Vallentyne 2002). This, of course, would have the wild implication that rats are protected by rights of self-ownership. Perhaps there is some plausible intermediate position, but if so, it has not yet been developed adequately (see Steiner 1999 for one attempt).

5.2 Historical Principles and the Real World

According to libertarianism, the justice of the current distribution of legal rights over resources depends on what the past was like. Given that the history of the world is full of systematic violence (genocide, invasion, murder, assault, theft, etc.), we can be sure that the current distribution of legal rights over resources did not come about justly and that adequate reparations have not been made. At the same time, however, we have little knowledge of the specific rights violations that took place in the past (e.g., we have little knowledge of all but the most egregious rights violations that took place more than one hundred years ago). Thus, we have little knowledge of what justice today requires.

The epistemic problem confronting libertarianism is similar to that confronting utilitarianism and other consequentialist theories. Consequentialist theories require knowledge of the entire future that will result from each possible action, and we have very little such knowledge. Libertarianism requires knowledge of the entire past, and we have very little such knowledge. The appropriate answer in both cases is that the facts determine what is just, and we should simply make our best judgments about what is just based on what we know. Moral reality is complex, and it's not surprising that it's extremely difficult to know what is permissible.

In the case of libertarianism, an additional response is possible. One could hold that there is a moral statute of limitations for rights violations. After the passage of enough time—or perhaps, after the passage of enough time during which no claim for rectification is made—the right of rectification for a specific past rights-violation may cease to be valid. If the period of time is short enough (e.g., 100 years), this would radically reduce the epistemic problem. It's not clear, however, that there is a plausible principled libertarian justification (as opposed to a practical one) for such a statute of limitations.

6. Conclusion

Libertarianism is attractive because (1) it provides significant moral liberty of action, (2) it provides significant moral protection against interference from others, and (3) it is sensitive to what the past was like (e.g., what agreements were made and what rights violations took place). It thus takes seriously the idea of persons as individually responsible agents each with their own life to live. Libertarianism faces, however, the serious objection that it gives too much protection from interference and not enough attention to the immediate consequences of their principles (e.g., whether people's basic needs are met, their lives go better, or equality is promoted). As with all prominent moral and political theories, the overall assessment of libertarianism is a matter of on-going debate.

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Related Topics

  • Barnett, R. E., 2004, “The Moral Foundations of Modern Libertarianism,” in P. Berkowitz (ed.), Varieties of Conservatism in America, Stanford: Hoover Press, pp. 51–74.
  • Chartier, G., 2012, Anarchy and Legal Order: Law and Politics for a Stateless Society, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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  • Gaus, G. and E. Mack, 2004, “Libertarianism and Classical Liberalism,” in A Handbook of Political Theory, G. Gaus and C. Kukathus (eds.), London: Routledge, pp. 115–129.
  • Kagan, S., 1994, “The Argument from Liberty,” in In Harm's Way: Essays in honor of Joel Feinberg, J. Coleman and A. Buchanan (eds.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 16–41.
  • Huemer, M., 2012, The Problem of Political Authority, New York: Palgrave MacMillan.
  • Railton, P., 2003, “Locke, Stock, and Peril: Natural Property Rights, Pollution, and Risk,” in P. Railton, Facts, Values, and Norms, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 187–225
  • Sanders, J. and J. Narveson (eds.), 1996, For and Against the State, London: Rowman & Littlefield.
  • Skoble, A., 2008, Deleting the State, New York: Open Court Press.
  • Simmons, A.J., 1992, The Lockean Theory of Rights, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 1993, On the Edge of Anarchy, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Sobel, D., 2012, “Backing Away from Libertarian Self-Ownership,” Ethics, 123: 32-60
  • Sreenivasan, G., 1995, The Limits of Lockean Rights in Property, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Tomasi, T., 2012, Free Market Fairness, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Vallentyne, P., 2002, “Equality and the Duties of Procreators,” in Children and Political Theory, D. Archard and C. MacLeod (eds.), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2007, “Libertarianism and the State,” Social Philosophy and Policy, 24: 187–205.

Acknowledgments

For helpful comments, we thank Jerry Gaus, Brad Hooker, Roderick Long, Eric Mack, Mike Otsuka, Thomas Pogge, Eric Roark, Danny Shapiro, Aeon Skoble, Hillel Steiner, Nic Tideman, Alan Tomhave, Jon Trerise, and Matt Zwolinski.

Copyright © 2014 by
Peter Vallentyne <vallentynep@missouri.edu>
Bas van der Vossen <b_vande2@uncg.edu>

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