Practical Reason

First published Mon Oct 13, 2003; substantive revision Wed Jul 31, 2024

Practical reason is the general human capacity for resolving, through reflection, the question of what one is to do. Deliberation of this kind is practical in at least two senses. First, it is practical in its subject matter, insofar as it is concerned with action. But it is also practical in its consequences or its issue, insofar as reflection about action itself directly moves people to act. Our capacity for deliberative self-determination raises two sets of philosophical problems. For one thing, there are questions about how deliberation can succeed in being practical in its issue. What do we need to assume—both about agents and about the processes of reasoning they engage in—to make sense of the fact that deliberative reflection can directly give rise to action? Can we do justice to this dimension of practical reason while preserving the idea that practical deliberation is genuinely a form of reasoning? For another, there are large issues concerning the content of the standards that are brought to bear in practical reasoning. Which norms for the assessment of action are binding on us as deliberating agents? Do these norms provide resources for critical reflection about our ends, or are they exclusively instrumental? Under what conditions do moral norms yield valid standards for reasoning about action? The first set of issues is addressed in sections §§1–3 of the present article, while sections §§4–6 cover the second set of issues.

1. Practical and Theoretical Reason

Practical reason defines a distinctive standpoint of reflection. When agents deliberate about action, they think about themselves and their situation in characteristic ways. What are some of the salient features of the practical point of view?

A natural way to interpret this point of view is to contrast it with the standpoint of theoretical reason. The latter standpoint is occupied when we engage in reasoning that is directed at the resolution of questions that are in some sense theoretical rather than practical; but how are we to understand this opposition between the theoretical and the practical? One possibility is to understand theoretical reflection as reasoning about questions of explanation and prediction. Looking backward to events that have already taken place, it asks why they have occurred; looking forward, it attempts to determine what is going to happen in the future. Theoretical reasoning, understood along these lines, finds paradigmatic expression in the natural and social sciences. By extension, it also covers matters of non-causal explanation, which are explored in the philosophical disciplines that focus metaphysical, logical and conceptual questions. In these ways, theoretical reflection is concerned with matters of fact and their explanation. Furthermore it treats these issues in impersonal terms that are accessible (in principle) to anyone.

Practical reason, by contrast, takes a distinctively normative question as its starting point. It typically asks, of a set of alternatives for action none of which has yet been performed, what one ought to do, or which option is best (or at least sufficiently) supported by reasons. It is thus concerned not with matters of empirical, metaphysical, or logical fact and their explanation, but with matters of value or, more generally, with the normative evaluation of action. In practical reasoning agents attempt to assess and weigh their reasons for action, the considerations that speak for and against alternative courses of action that are open to them. Moreover they do this from a distinctively first-personal point of view, one that is defined in terms of a practical predicament in which they find themselves (either individually or collectively—people sometimes reason jointly about what they should do together).

There is, however, a different and arguably better way of understanding the contrast between practical and theoretical reason, stressing the parallels rather than the differences between the two forms of reflection (see e.g. Berker 2013). According to this interpretation, theoretical reflection too is concerned with a normative rather than a merely descriptive question, namely with the question of what one ought, or is permitted, to believe. It attempts to answer this normative question by assessing and weighing reasons for belief, the considerations that speak for and against the particular conclusions one might draw about the way the world is. Furthermore, it does this from a standpoint of first-personal reflection: the stance of theoretical reasoning in this sense is the committed stance of the believer, not the stance of detached contemplation of one’s beliefs themselves (Moran 2001; Boyle 2011). Seen in this way, the contrast between practical and theoretical reason is essentially a contrast between two different systems of norms: practical norms for the regulation of action on the one hand, and epistemic norms for the regulation of belief on the other. (For recent discussion of the relations between these kinds of norms, see the contributions in McHugh et al. 2018).

Theoretical reason, interpreted along these lines, addresses the considerations that recommend accepting particular claims as to what is or is not the case. That is, it involves reflection with an eye to the truth of propositions, and the reasons for belief in which it deals are (at least paradigmatically) evidential considerations that increase the likelihood of propositions. Practical reason, by contrast, is concerned not with the credibility of beliefs but with the desirability or choiceworthiness of actions. The reasons in which it deals are considerations that contribute to making it the case that actions are worthy of performance in some way. This difference in subject matter corresponds to a further difference between the two forms of reason, in respect of their consequences. Theoretical reflection about what one ought to believe produces changes in one’s overall set of beliefs, whereas practical reason gives rise to action; as noted above, it is practical not only in its subject matter, but also in its issue.

One way to develop this line of thought would be to treat reason in all its forms as oriented toward the questions that it aims to settle (Hieronymi 2005, 2021). There are questions that individuals face about what to think, but also about what to do. In reasoning about these questions, we mobilize considerations that bear directly on them, a process that is brought to a conclusion by our forming the beliefs or taking the actions that constitutively settle the questions we initially faced. Theoretical and practical reason are similar in that they involve capacities to resolve questions through reflection on reasons; they differ, however, in the kinds of question they aim to settle.

Two observations should be made about the contrast between theoretical and practical reason. First, one might be tempted to think that there is a categorial difference in the consequences of theoretical and practical reason, insofar as the former produces changes in our mental states, whereas the latter gives rise to bodily movements. But it would be misleading to contrast the two kinds of rational capacity in these terms. Practical reason gives rise not to bodily movements per se, but to intentional actions, which are processes with an essential attitudinal component. It would thus be more accurate to characterize the issue of both theoretical and practical reason as attitudes; the difference is that the exercise of theoretical reason leads to modifications of our beliefs, whereas the exercise of practical reason leads to modifications of our intentions (Harman 1986; Bratman 1987) —understanding intentions to include not just plans for the future, but also intentions in action (cf. the entry on intention).

Second, it is important to be clear that in neither case do the characteristic modifications of attitude occur infallibly. There is room for irrationality both in the theoretical and the practical domain, which in at least one prominent form involves a failure to form the attitudes that one acknowledges to be called for by the considerations one has reflected on (cf. Scanlon 2007). Thus a person might end up reading a mystery novel for another hour, while at the same time judging that they should go back to work on their paper for the upcoming conference. Practical irrationality of this latter kind is known as akrasia, incontinence, or weakness of will, and its nature and even possibility are traditional subjects of philosophical speculation in their own right (see also the entry on weakness of will). If we assume that this strong kind of practical irrationality is possible, however, then we must grant that practical reason, like other capacities, is not necessarily successful. In other words, deliberation about action generates appropriate intentions only insofar as an agent is rational (Korsgaard 1996).

Intentions and beliefs are not the only attitudes that are answerable to reasons; emotions too have their reasons, understood as considerations by reference to which they can be justified or criticized. Thus it is appropriate or fitting for someone who is in the presence of imminent danger to feel fear, and by the same token fear is inapt or irrational if it is felt about something that is known to be harmless. Though emotions are responsive to reasons, however, we do not typically form or modify them through processes of reflection or deliberation. Reflective modification of our beliefs and intentions, by contrast, is common, and commonly understood to involve an exercise of our capacities for theoretical and practical reason.

Reasoning is commonly taken to be an inferential process that takes as input some attitudes of a subject, and yields as output the formation or modification of other attitudes (Harman 1986). Inferential processes of this kind are involved in the paradigmatic cases in which we exercise our capacities for both theoretical and practical reason. In the practical case, however, there is an interesting question about how exactly to understand the outputs of our reasoning. On a narrow conception, all reasoning is concerned with the formation or modification of belief, and practical reasoning in particular is concerned with the formation and modification of normative beliefs about action. The adjustments in our intentions that result from such reflection are not themselves conclusions of reasoning (Raz 2011: Ch. 7, 2022: Ch. 3). Agents who have resolved the question of what they ought or have reason to do still have a question to settle, about what they are going to do. But proponents of the narrow conception would note that this further question is not one that is to be resolved through reasoning: once one has figured out what one ought to do, there is no practical reasoning left to be done.

On a broader conception, practical reasoning concludes directly in intentions. According to this view, we resolve through reasoning the question of what we are going to do (Broome 2013: Ch. 14; McHugh and Way 2022: Ch. 2). This can also be said about a third and even broader conception according to which practical reasoning can conclude directly in action (Dancy 2018; Tenenbaum 2020). This view – which is often (though not uncontroversially, cf. Corcilius 2008) associated with Aristotle – arguably goes beyond the traditional picture of reasoning as inference, but recall that even those who take actions to be conclusions of reasoning will think that they are such conclusions only if and because they are intentional and thus have an essentially attitudinal component.

Proponents of each of these accounts of practical reasoning should agree, however, that practical reason involves some capacity to modify our intentions. This is implicit in the idea that there are rational constraints on intentions to which we respond through our broadly rational capacities, constraints that are violated (for instance) in cases of akrasia. The question under dispute is whether we exercise this capacity for the modification of our intentions through reasoning, or in some other way.

We distinguished two ways of understanding the contrast between theoretical and practical reason. On the first, theoretical reason is concerned with understanding descriptive facts and their explanation, while practical reason is concerned with the normative assessment of action and the generation of intentional action in light of it. This conception arguably neglects the normative dimension of theoretical reason, which in turn is emphasized by the second understanding. According to it, while practical reason normatively assesses and generates actions or practical attitudes in light of this assessment, theoretical reason normatively assesses and generates beliefs or doxastic attitudes in light of this assessment, where the norms in case of theoretical reason are distinctively epistemic norms.

Both of these understandings should be distinguished from a third one, according to which neither theoretical nor practical reason is particularly concerned with normative assessment at all. According to this coherentist or structuralist conception, theoretical reason pertains to the coherence of a subject’s doxastic attitudes, while practical reason pertains to the coherence of a subject’s practical attitudes (see esp. Broome 2013, 2021; and the entry on structural rationality). We come back to this position below in §4.

2. Naturalism and Normativity

The connection of practical reason with intentional action raises large questions about its credentials as a capacity for genuine reasoning. As noted above, intentional action is not mere bodily movement, but reflects a distinctive attitude of the agent’s, viz., intention. To be in this kind of mental state is to have a conception of action that guides one’s bodily movements as they unfold. Intention seems in this respect to be strikingly unlike belief, which has a representational function. Beliefs aim to fit the way the world is, so that if one discovers that the world is not how one previously took it to be, one will acknowledge pressure to modify one’s belief in the relevant dimension (pressure to which one will respond if one is not irrational). With intentions however things seem crucially different in this respect (Smith 1987). The intention to go shopping on Wednesday, for instance, is not a state that would or should be abandoned upon ascertaining or confirming that one has not (yet) gone shopping on Wednesday; rather a person with such an intention will ordinarily try to bring the world into alignment with the intention, by going shopping when Wednesday comes around. Intentions are in this way more like an architect’s blueprints than like sketches of an already-completed structure (Anscombe 1957; cf. Velleman 1989). Put in terms of an influential and controversially discussed metaphor first introduced by Searle (1983), beliefs have a “mind-to-world direction of fit”, while intentions seem to have a “world-to-mind direction of fit” (see Frost 2014 for a critical overview of different accounts of this distinction).

Reflection on this contrast between belief and intention has led some philosophers to ask whether practical reason might not be something of a misnomer. The difficulty, in a nutshell, is to make sense of the suggestion that a genuinely rational process could by itself generate states with the peculiar function of intentions. Reason seems a capacity for cognitive operations, whereas intentions are distinctively noncognitive states, insofar as they do not aim to reflect independent facts of the matter about the way things happen to be in the world (cf. Hume 1739: Bk. 2, Sec. 3.3).

Expressivism represents one line of response to this skeptical worry about practical reason. Accounts of this kind offer interpretations of the normative language that figures prominently in practical reflection. As was seen in section §1, such reflection addresses an agent’s reasons for acting in one way or another. Such conclusions are sometimes expressed in evaluative terms, as claims about what it would be good to do (cf. Bittner 2023), or as deontic conclusions about the actions that one ought to (or may) perform (cf. Parfit 2011; Schmidt 2024); and they are, in any case, normative judgements. According to the expressivist, however, normative conclusions of these kinds do not represent genuine cognitive achievements, judgments that are literally capable of being true or false. Rather they give expression to desires, sentiments, plans, and other pro-attitudes, the sorts of goal-directed noncognitive state that move people to action. The expressivist contends that we can make sense of the capacity of practical reason to generate states with the peculiar structure and function of intentions only if normative judgements are understood along these lines.

Expressivism in this form suggests a naturalistic interpretation of practical reason, one that may seem appropriate to the enlightened commitments of the modern scientific world view. It is naturalistic metaphysically, insofar as it makes no commitment to the objective existence in the world of such allegedly questionable entities as values, norms, or reasons for action. If normative and evaluative claims do not represent genuine cognitive achievements, then their legitimacy does not depend on our postulating a realm of normative facts to which those claims must be capable of corresponding. It is also naturalistic psychologically, insofar as it yields explanations of intentional human behavior that are basically continuous with explanations of the behavior of non-rational animals. In both the human and the non-human case, behavior is understood as the causal product of noncognitive attitudes, operating in conjunction with a creature’s factual representation of how things are in its environment. The special sophistication of human agency may be traced to the fact that humans have much more sophisticated linguistic methods for giving voice to their motivating noncognitive attitudes. Indeed, many contemporary expressivists would contend that these expressive resources are sufficiently powerful that we can explain by means of them the features of practical deliberation that initially give it the appearance of a genuine form of reasoning (Blackburn 1998; Gibbard 1990, 2003; Ridge 2014; see also the entry on moral cognitivism vs. non-cognitivism).

Other philosophers remain unimpressed with this naturalistic approach to practical reason. One ground for dissatisfaction with it is the following. The expressivist strategy relies on an initial contrast between practical reflection on the one hand, and the genuine forms of cognitive activity characteristic of theoretical reasoning on the other. There has to be some important sense in which practical discourse does not satisfy the standards of rationality that distinguish authentic cognitive discourse in the literal sense; otherwise the contention that normative discourse is expressive rather than cognitive will lack any significant content. But the contrast between theoretical and practical reflection required for this purpose seems elusive. As we saw in section §1 above, theoretical reasoning, like practical reasoning, is plausibly understood to be a normative enterprise. It traffics in epistemic reasons for belief, after all, and such reasons are arguably no less normative than practical reasons for action (Cuneo 2007; Kiesewetter 2022b). To the extent that this is the case, theoretical and practical reason would seem equally problematic from the naturalistic perspective. To accommodate these points, the expressivist program may have to be extended to theoretical reasoning, a project that encounters challenges of its own (cf. Cuneo 2007; Schroeder 2008).

A different ground for concern about expressivism has to do with the distinction between normative judgment and intention. Expressivism traditionally makes sense of the fact that practical reason is practical in its issue by collapsing this distinction. Normative reflection can bring about adjustments in our intentions because it just is a set of operations on our intentions (or intention-like practical states). Compliance with what we ordinarily think of as a rational requirement, to bring our intentions into alignment with our normative beliefs, is thus secured through a kind of conceptual fiat. The result is that there is no room, on this position, for the paradigmatic form of irrationality in practice represented by akrasia, whereby agents fail to intend what they themselves believe they ought to do. Expressivists might try to leave room for this possibility by distinguishing between intentions and the practical attitudes that are mobilized in practical thought about what to do. But this threatens to leave the approach without an account of the ability of normative thought to engage the will.

Many of those who reject expressivism would endorse some variety of realism about the subject matter of practical reason. The basic commitment of realism in this domain is the idea that there are facts of the matter about what we have reason to do that are prior to and independent of our deliberations, to which those deliberations are ultimately answerable. Theorists of this stripe picture practical reason as a capacity for reflection about an objective body of normative truths regarding action (Skorupski 2010; Parfit 2011; Scanlon 2014). While many realists take normative truths to be irreducibly normative, others hold that they can ultimately be reduced to truths that are at least in principle subject to the natural sciences (e.g., Smith 1994; Jackson 1998; Schroeder 2007a; see also the entry on normativity in metaethics).

Since realists maintain a cognitivist interpretation of normative judgements, they have an easier time than expressivists to explain the possibility of akrasia. By the same token, they have a harder time explaining how practical reason can issue in intentions (see section §3 for further discussion). An alternative approach—different both from realism and from the kind of expressivism sketched above—is Kantian constructivism (Korsgaard 1996, 1997). This approach denies that practical reason is a capacity for reflection about an objective domain of independent normative facts; but it equally rejects the expressivist’s naturalistic suspicion of normativity (but cf. Street 2008; Müller 2020 for versions of constructivism that are more favorable to naturalism). According to the Kantian constructivist, practical reason is governed by genuine normative constraints, which for Kant himself included the hypothetical and categorical imperatives (cf. Kant 1785). But what makes these constraints normative is precisely their relation to the will of the agents whose decisions they govern. The principles of practical reason are constitutive principles of rational agency, binding on us insofar as we necessarily commit ourselves to complying with them in willing anything at all (Korsgaard 2009; cf. Enoch 2006). The realm of the normative, on this approach, is not pictured as a body of truths or facts that are prior to and independent of the will; rather, it is taken to be ‘constructed’ by agents through their own volitional activity (see also the entry on constructivism in metaethics).

3. Reasons and Motivation

The capacity of practical reason to give rise to intentional action divides even those philosophers who agree in rejecting the expressivist strategy discussed above. Many such philosophers are prepared to grant that there are facts and truths about practical reasons, and to accept the cognitive credentials of discourse about this distinctive domain of facts and truths. But they differ in their accounts of the truth conditions of the normative claims that figure in such discourse. We may distinguish the following two approaches. The first of these, often referred to as internalism, holds that reasons for action must be grounded in an agent’s prior motivations (Williams 1979; cf. Finlay 2009). According to this influential position, a given agent s can have reason to do x only if x-ing would speak to or advance some element in s’s ‘subjective motivational set’. There must be some rational connection between s’s x-ing and the subjective motivations to which s is actually already subject; otherwise the claim that s has reason to x must be rejected, as false or incoherent. Behind this internalist position lies the idea that practical reason is practical in its issue. Internalists contend that we can make sense of the generation of new intentions through reasoning only if we assume that such reasoning is conditioned by motivational resources that are already to hand. Practical reason, on the internalist account, is the capacity to work out the implications of the commitments contained in one’s existing subjective motivational set; the upshot is that motivation is prior to practical reason, and constrains it.

Externalists reject this picture, contending that one can have reasons for action that are independent of one’s prior motivations. They typically agree that practical reasoning is capable of generating new motivations and actions. They agree, in other words, that if agent s has reason to do x, it must be possible for s to acquire the motivation to x through reflection on the relevant reasons. But they deny that such reasoning must in any significant way be constrained by s’s subjective motivations prior to the episode of reasoning. On this approach, practical reason is not conceived as a capacity for working out the implications of one’s existing desires and commitments. Instead, reasons are taken to be features of an agent’s situation that make actions objectively choiceworthy, and reflection on such reasons can open up new motivational possibilities (Parfit 1997; Dancy 2000). This disagreement is conventionally understood to be driven by diverging approaches to the explanation of intentional action. Internalists are impressed by the differences between intentions and the cognitive states that figure in paradigmatic examples of theoretical reasoning. Pointing to these differences, they ask how practical reason can succeed in producing new intentions if it is not based in something of the same basic psychological type: a motivation or desire that is already part of the agent’s subjective motivational equipment. Many externalists find this contrast between intentions and cognitive states overdrawn. They hold that we need to postulate basic dispositions of normative responsiveness to account for the capacity of theoretical reflection about reasons to affect our beliefs, and question why these same dispositions cannot explain the fact that practical reasoning is practical in its consequences. Cognitive or not, intentions belong to the broad class of attitudes that are sensitive to judgments, and this may account for the capacity of practical reflection to generate new intentions (Scanlon 1998: Ch. 1). A third possibility is that intentions result from dispositions or capacities distinct from the psychic mechanisms that render theoretical rationality possible. Depending on how it is developed, this approach may offer a different way of accounting for the practical consequences of practical reflection, without assuming that reasons for action are grounded in an agent’s subjective motivations (Velleman 2000: Ch. 8; Wallace 1999). (For more on practical reasons and motivation, see also the entry on reasons for action: internal vs. external.)

The connection between practical reasoning and motivation is not the only consideration that has led philosophers to adopt internalist or desire-based theories of reasons for action. More recently, it has been argued that such theories are in a better position to explain our normative reasons themselves (Schroeder 2007a). There are cases in which features of a person’s psychology make an obvious difference to what the person has reason to do. Some people like to dance, others detest this activity, and this difference in their “desires” appears to determine a corresponding difference in their reasons. Even in cases of this kind, however, it is far from obvious that differences in the agent’s desires are what ultimately explain their differing reasons (Scanlon 2014). Moreover, the fact that psychological factors might sometimes be relevant to the explanation of a person’s reasons does not entail that they always have explanatory relevance.

4. Instrumental and Structural Rationality

Among the norms of practical reason, those of instrumental rationality have seemed least controversial to many philosophers. Instrumental rationality, in its most basic form, instructs agents to take those means that are necessary in relation to their given ends. In the modern era, this form of rationality has widely been viewed as the single unproblematic requirement of practical reason. The instrumental principle makes no assumptions about the prospects for rational scrutiny of peoples’ ends. Rational criticism of this kind apparently presupposes that there are objective values or norms, providing standards for assessment of ends that are independent from psychological facts about what people happen to be motivated to pursue. In line with the naturalistic attitude sketched in section §2, however, it may be doubted whether such independent standards can be reconciled with the metaphysical commitments of contemporary scientific practice. A world that is shorn of objective values or norms leaves no room for rational criticism of peoples’ ends, but only for Weberian Zweckrationalität: the rational determination of means to the realization of ends that are taken to be given, as a matter of human psychological fact (Weber 1978).

This line of thought can be traced back to the philosophy of David Hume, who famously asserted that ‘Reason is, and ought only to be the slave of the passions’ (Hume 1739: 415). Those attracted to the Humean approach should bear in mind, however, that the instrumental principle is itself an objective norm. The principle says that we are rationally required to take the means that are necessary to achieve our ends; if the principle represents a binding norm of practical reason, then we are open to rational criticism to the extent we fail to exhibit this kind of instrumental consistency, regardless of whether we want to comply with the principle or not. If naturalism really entails that there can be no objective norms or values, it may be wondered how an exception can possibly be made for the instrumental requirement (Hampton 1998). A more consistently naturalistic position would be to reject even Zweckrationalität in favor of a skeptical attitude towards practical reason in all its forms—an attitude that may well correspond to the intentions of the historical Hume (cf. Dreier 1997; Millgram 1995).

Further questions can be raised about the plausibility of the suggestion that the instrumental norm exhausts the requirements of practical reason. The norm says that one should take the means that are necessary relative to one’s psychologically-given ends. But how can the fact that a given means exhibits this kind of necessity give a person reason to choose the means, if the end is not itself something it would be valuable to achieve in some way? The instrumental principle seems to function as a binding norm of practical reason only if it is taken for granted that there are additional, independent standards for the assessment of our ends (Quinn 1993; Korsgaard 1997). Otherwise, it would be possible for us to create normative reasons for action simply by adopting ends we have no reason to adopt – a form of “bootstrapping” that is widely regarded as implausible (Bratman 1981; Broome 2001).

Restricting the instrumental principle to reasonable ends raises another problem, however. Agents who fail to take the means to unreasonable ends and those failing to take the means to reasonable ends seem equally criticizable as instrumentally irrational or means/end-incoherent. How could this be the case if the instrumental principle applies only to reasonable ends? On a widely discussed approach, the instrumental principle has to be understood as a “wide-scope” normative requirement or reason, which instructs us to be means/end-coherent, but leaves open whether to achieve this by taking the means or by giving up the end (Broome 1999; Wallace 2001; Bratman 2009). Thus understood, the instrumental principle applies equally to all ends (reasonable or not), but the detachment of reasons to take means to unreasonable ends is avoided nevertheless. Similar proposals have been made about other kinds of principles governing the coherence of our attitudes, including consistency requirements on beliefs (e.g., Dancy 1977). Moreover, in recent years it has become standard to distinguish requirements of structural rationality, such as the instrumental principle, from substantive normative requirements or reasons (Broome 2013; Brunero 2020; Worsnip 2021). On this view, the detachment of reasons for taking means to unreasonable ends can be avoided either by claiming that structural requirements take “wide-scope”, or by claiming that we do not generally have reasons to be structurally rational (Kolodny 2005).

Structural requirements of this kind have recently become a subject of lively philosophical debate. The idea that there are coherence requirements on our attitudes appears to be common ground among philosophers who differ significantly in their views about the nature and scope of practical reason. It is accepted by most Humeans, for instance, who believe that there is no scope for the rational criticism of individual ends, and also by Kantians, who think that the requirements of reason ultimately constrain us to choose in accordance with the moral law. From the perspective of practical and theoretical deliberation, we commonly seem to grant the force of structural requirements, acknowledging a kind of rational pressure to bring our beliefs and intentions into compliance with the instrumental principle and other standards of consistency and coherence.

Many philosophers take such structural requirements at face value, granting that practical reason is governed by and responsive to them. Indeed, it has influentially been argued that standards of good reasoning, in both the practical and the theoretical domain, derive exclusively from structural requirements of rationality (Broome 2013). But questions arise about this approach. If structural requirements are independent of reasons, it is an open question whether we have any reason to comply with them, and the question has forcefully been argued to receive a negative answer (Kolodny 2005). But then it becomes unclear why we should care about whether our attitudes are structurally rational and why the charge of irrationality is commonly taken to be a serious form of criticism (Kiesewetter 2017).

More generally, there is a question about how to conceive of the relation between structural requirements and normative reasons. One view, held in common by some Humeans and by some Kantian constructivists (see sec. §2 above), is that reasons are fundamentally derivative from requirements of structural rationality. What one has reason to do, on this view, is what one would desire or intend to do if one was fully rational (i.e. fully in compliance with the structural requirements that govern one’s attitudes) (cf. Smith 1994; Markovits 2014). It is unclear, however, how such idealized attitude accounts can avoid revisionary normative implications without smuggling in substantive normative assumptions into the notion of an ideally coherent agent (Worsnip 2021).

For those who do not share this reductionist view, the status of structural requirements becomes more puzzling. One might hold that practical reason is ultimately answerable to two different kinds of constraints: to structural requirements on the one hand, and to independent facts about what one has reason to do on the other hand (cf. Worsnip 2021). But this position is potentially unstable. As pointed out already, once the independence of structural requirements from normative reasons is made clear, it is no longer obvious why we should care about whether our attitudes do or do not comply with the structural requirements.

On an alternative view, it is a myth that rationality requires means/end-coherence as such (Raz 2005; Kolodny 2008), or more generally that there are any structural requirements of rationality (Kiesewetter 2017; Lord 2018). According to this position, coherence should be seen as a side effect of responding correctly to reasons rather than a rational requirement on its own, and the appearance of structural requirements can be explained by substantive features of the reasons to which both practical and theoretical reason are ultimately and properly responsive. (For more on this, see also the entries on instrumental rationality and on structural rationality.)

5. Maximizing Rationality

Proponents of Humean approaches to practical reason have attempted to accommodate the rational criticism of individual ends, without departing from the spirit of Zweckrationalität, by expanding their view to encompass the totality of an agent’s ends. Thus, even if there are no reasons or values that are ultimately independent of an agent’s given ends, the possibility remains that we could criticize particular intrinsic desires by reference to others in an agent’s subjective motivational set. An agent’s desire for leisure, for instance, might be subordinated insofar as its satisfaction would frustrate the realization of other goals that are subjectively more important to the agent, such as professional success. Practical reason, it might be suggested, is a holistic enterprise, properly concerned not merely with identifying means to the realization of individual ends, but with the coordinated achievement of the totality of an agent’s ends.

Many philosophers take this holistic approach to be the most promising way of thinking about practical reason. It defines an important and difficult problem for practical reason to address, without departing from the metaphysically modest assumption that there is no court of appeal for the rational criticism of an agent’s ends that is independent of those ends themselves. The holistic approach finds its most sophisticated and influential expression in the maximizing conception of practical rationality. According to the maximizing conception, the fundamental task of practical reason is to determine which course of action would optimally advance the agent’s complete set of ends, which is typically identified with the action whose subjective expected utility—reflecting both the utility and probability of possible outcomes from the agent’s point of view (i.e. in terms of the agent’s preferences and credences or beliefs)—is the highest.

The maximizing conception of practical rationality has been influentially developed in decision theory and in the theory of rational choice (as studied, for instance, in modern economics). These disciplines articulate with mathematical precision the basic idea that practical rationality is a matter of consistency in action: people act rationally to the extent they do what is likely to bring about the best state of affairs, given both their preferences and their credences about the outcomes that may be brought about through their agency. Proponents of these theories sometimes claim for them the additional advantage of empirical adequacy, arguing that they are flexible enough to accommodate the full range of behaviors that human agents engage in, both within the marketplace and outside of it. Especially if one operates with the notion of ‘revealed preferences’—preferences, that is, that are ascribed to agents solely on the basis of actual behavior—then virtually anything an agent might choose to do could be interpreted as an attempt to maximize expected utility. Decision theory, on the resulting interpretation of it, becomes an all-encompassing framework for understanding free human behavior, according to which all agents who act freely are striving to produce outcomes that would be optimal, relative to their current preferences and beliefs.

If decision theory is interpreted in this way, however, then its relevance to the understanding of practical reason may appear correspondingly tenuous (cf. Pettit and Smith 1997). The maximization of subjective utility is supposed to represent a normative ideal, one by appeal to which we can assess critically the deliberations of agents. In this guise, the attraction of the maximizing model lies in the idea that there can be rational requirements on action, stemming from the totality of an agent’s preferences and credences, even if we do not assume that there are independent, substantive standards for the critical assessment of individual ends. But this normative interpretation of maximizing rationality is tenable only if it is at least conceivable that individual agents might sometimes fail to satisfy its requirements—an ‘ought’ that it is not so much as possible to flout is not really an ‘ought’ at all (Lavin 2004). Thus the axioms of decision theory include constraints on an agent’s overall preferences (such as completeness and transitivity) that might be violated even by agents who are striving to satisfy their currently strongest desires. Such agents will be criticizable by the lights of decision theory insofar as there is no consistent utility function that can be ascribed to them on the basis of their actual choices and behavior. The normative credentials of decision theory rest, then, on the plausibility of the axioms that are taken to define an individual utility function—axioms that may not be quite as innocent or uncontroversial as they initially appear (cf. Mandler 2001).

Further questions arise about the plausibility of the normative requirement to maximize expected utility. Doubts have been expressed, for instance, in regard to the assumption that it is necessarily irrational to fail to select that action that would be optimal, relative to one’s preferences and credences. Perfectly rational agents often appear to be content with states of affairs that are ‘good enough’, from the perspective of their aims and desires, even when they know that alternatives are available that promise a higher return; they ‘satisfice’, rather than seeking to maximize the value of the outcomes achievable through their actions (Slote 1989). They also treat their past intentions and plans as defeasibly fixed constraints on deliberation, rather than attempting to maximize subjective utility anew in every situation they confront (Bratman 1987). Finally, they can adopt different attitudes toward risk, attaching greater importance to avoiding bad outcomes than to maximizing expected utility, as classically conceived (Buchak 2013). Defenders of the maximizing model contend that it is flexible enough to accommodate alleged counterexamples of these kinds (Pettit 1984). If not, however, there may be grounds for doubting that it represents a basic norm or practical reason.

A different issue about maximizing rationality concerns the set of desires or aims that is taken as fixed for purposes of applying the requirement of maximization. We may distinguish two basic approaches. The first and perhaps most common of these takes the subjective utility of alternative actions to be determined by the agent’s preferences at the time of deliberation. According to this interpretation of the maximization model, we are rational to the extent we do that which best promotes the totality of our present aims. A second and quite different interpretation results if we expand the set of desires that determine the subjective utilities of outcomes to include the totality of the agent’s preferences over time. According to this model, rational agents aim to maximize the satisfaction of all of their anticipated desires, accepting frustration of present preferences for the sake of greater satisfaction at later times (Sidgwick 1907; Parfit 1984: Pt. 2; Pettit and Smith 1997). This interpretation of the maximizing model gives expression to the common idea that a certain prudential regard for one’s own future well-being is a requirement of practical reason (Nagel 1978: Chs. 5–8). But if we take it to be a comprehensive account of rationality in action, the prudential interpretation can also appear to be an unstable compromise: if practical reason requires us to factor in our future desires, should it not equally demand that we take into account the desires of other agents who may be affected by what we do? Why should we take the distinction between persons to be significant for the theory of practical reason, once we have denied such significance to the distinction between different times in the life of a single agent (Parfit 1984; cf. section §6 below)?

However we define the class of desires that is subject to the requirement of maximization, we do not need to take those desires exactly as they are given. Many proponents of the maximizing approach suggest that an agent’s actual desires should be laundered somewhat before the demand to maximize is applied. For instance, if my desire for X is contingent on a false factual belief about the nature of X, then it is questionable that practical reason requires that the desire be taken into account in determining what it is rational for me to do. A popular form of laundering would rule out desires of this kind, by subjecting to the requirement of maximization only those desires that would survive if the agent were factually well-informed about the objects of desire and the circumstances of action, and deliberating in a calm and focused frame of mind. Indeed, once we are in the business of laundering desires we can go still further, excluding from consideration desires that are substantively objectionable, even if they would survive the filter of corrected factual belief. This would at least be a way to counter bootstrapping objections of the kind we discussed above in section §4. To move into this territory, however, would clearly be to abandon the Humean framework of the original maximizing approach, assuming resources for the rational criticism of ends that are independent of the agent’s actual dispositions.

Some philosophers might respond to the cases that invite desire-laundering by distinguishing between subjective and objective dimensions of practical reason—between what one has reason to do, given all the facts about one’s situation, and what one has reason to do given one’s beliefs about the situation or the evidence that is available to one. This is a distinction that can be brought to bear on any conception of reasons and rationality, insofar as agents operate with epistemic limitations that deprive them of access to facts that are potentially relevant. To borrow an example from Judith Thomson (Thomson 1990: 229), it might seem obvious that it is rational to flip the light switch as you enter your office if it is dark outside and you are planning to do some reading. But suppose that flipping the switch will, through a series of remarkable coincidences that nobody could have anticipated, cause a dangerous lighting flash in the house next door. We might want to say that objectively, you had compelling reason not to operate the switch, even if you were perfectly rational to do so given the evidence available to you (cf. Parfit 2011: Chs. 5 and 7).

Applying this distinction to the maximizing approach, one might maintain that our corrected desires are relevant to determining what we objectively ought or have reason to do. But we are often not in a position to know the facts that determine what we have objective reason to do. When this is the case, we can hardly be faulted for a failure of rationality. Indeed, the potential inaccessibility of objective reasons raises larger questions about the standing of the objectivist conception of practical reason, according to which the central ‘ought’ of practical deliberation corresponds to what we have most objective reason to do. Perspectivists about practical reason argue that the ‘ought’ of deliberation must be understood in terms of an epistemically constrained notion of a reason (Kiesewetter 2011, 2017: Ch. 8). Some degree of desire laundering is defensible, according to this line of thought, but it should be understood to involve correction of desires in the light of facts about the world that are accessible to the agent.

6. Value, Prudence, and Morality

If maximizing rationality is not the unproblematic requirement of practical reason that it initially seemed to be, what are the alternatives to it? Let us begin with the assumption that critical assessment of an agent’s individual ends is off-limits. This idea has been questioned by many philosophers, who point out that our basic aims in life are often rather inchoate; people want, for instance, to be successful in their careers, and loyal to their friends, without being clear about what exactly these ends require of them. To the extent one’s ends are indeterminate in this way, they will not provide effective starting points for instrumental, maximizing, or even satisficing reflection. We need to specify such ends more precisely before we can begin to think about which means they require us to pursue, or to generate from them a rank-ordering of possible outcomes. Here is a possible task for practical reason that does not fit neatly into the categories of instrumental or maximizing reflection, however broadly construed (Kolnai 1962; Wiggins 1975; Richardson 1994).

Reflection about the nature of our given ends is not an easy or well-defined activity. There are no straightforward criteria for success in this kind of enterprise, and it is often unclear when it has been brought to a satisfactory conclusion. These considerations encourage the Humean assumption—especially widespread in the social sciences—that there is no reasoning about final ends. On the other hand, how is one supposed to clarify one’s largest and most important ends, if not by reasoning about them in some way? Rather than exclude such reflection because it does not conform to a narrowly scientific paradigm of reason, perhaps we should expand our conception of practical reason to make room for interpretative reflection about the ends of action. To do so would be to acknowledge that practical reason has an essentially heuristic dimension, one that is connected to the project of self-understanding (Williams 1979). By working out the meaning and implications of such antecedent commitments as loyalty or success, for instance, we also help to get clear the values that define who we really are (Taylor 1985).

Instrumental models of practical reason are sometimes thought to rest on a basically consequentialist account of the relation of action to value (Anderson 1993). According to this account, value inheres ultimately in states of affairs, insofar as it is these that are the objects of subjective preference rankings. Actions are then judged rational to the extent they bring about states of affairs that are valuable in this way. It is a matter of controversy, however, whether this is the most plausible way of thinking about the rationality of action. Defenders of satisficing models, for example, think that a given action can be rational even when it is acknowledged by the agent that a different action would bring about a more valuable state of affairs. Alternatively, it might be maintained that we can judge an action rational without being able to arrive at any clear independent ranking of the state of affairs produced by it, as better or worse than the alternatives. Perhaps our judgments of the value of actions are ultimately parasitic on our convictions about what there is reason to do or to admire; in that case, we will not be able to derive conclusions about reasons from antecedent premises in the theory of value (Scanlon 1998: Ch. 2). Related questions have been raised about the basic consequentialist assumption that value attaches in the first instance to states of affairs. Thus it may seem to distort our understanding of friendship, for instance, to maintain that what friends value fundamentally are states of affairs (involving, say, joint activities with the friend); what people value as friends are rather concrete particulars or relations, such as the persons with whom they are befriended or their relationships with those persons. Building on this idea in the theory of value, it has been proposed that actions are rational insofar as they succeed in expressing the attitudes that it is rational to adopt toward the true bearers of intrinsic value: people, animals, and things (Anderson 1993).

A supposed advantage of this expressive approach is its ability to explain the rationality of behaviors that seem intuitively sensible, but that are hard to fit into the consequentialist scheme (such as commitments deriving from one’s past involvement in an activity or project, which can look like an irrational weighting of ‘sunk costs’ to the consequentialist; cf. Nozick 1993). But some defenders of the consequentialist model contend that it can account for such phenomena. For instance, if friends have special, ‘agent-relative’ reasons to attend to the interests of each other—and not merely reasons to promote the neutral value of friendship wherever it may be instantiated—this can be expressed in consequentialist terms by introducing person-indexed value functions, which rank possible states of affairs in terms of their desirability from the agent’s point of view (Portmore 2011; Sen 2000; for criticism, see Schroeder 2007b; Wallace 2010; for more on this, see also the entry on value theory).

Whether or not we accept a consequentialist framework, questions in the theory of value would seem to be an important focus for practical reflection. Many philosophers are attracted to the idea that reasons for action are ultimately provided by the values that can be realized through action (Raz 1999). If this is right, and if we assume as well a realist or at least non-subjectivist conception of value, then a different way of conceptualizing the task of practical reason comes into view. This may be thought of not as a matter of maximizing the satisfaction of the agent’s given ends, nor of specifying ends that are still inchoate, but rather as the task of understanding and responding appropriately to the values that bear on action. This task in turn admits of a number of different interpretations. In the spirit of G. E. Moore (1903), we might interpret the evaluative reflection relevant to deliberation in consequentialist terms, as reflection about a property of goodness that is instantiated by states of the world (cf. Maguire 2016). An influential alternative to it, inspired by Aristotle, holds that the proper focus of practical reflection is not the production of good outcomes, but the goal of acting well as a person. According to this approach, the values that are relevant to determining what an agent ought to do are those that are specifically connected to human virtue; one acts well, on this view, to the extent one does what a good or virtuous person would do (Lawrence 1995; Foot 2001; Thompson 2008; Thomson 2008). A somewhat different view dispenses with the reference to the ideal of the virtuous person, appealing directly to the plurality of specific values that may be realized intrinsically through action. The result is an expansive conception of practical reason, according to which any concrete dimension of value that might be instantiated through our agency falls within the purview of practical deliberation (Raz 1999, 2011).

While such a value-based conception of practical reasons has become an increasingly influential alternative to the Humean, desire-based conception, the thesis that all practical reasons can be explained in terms of the value of actions has not gone unchallenged. Cases of incommensurable values or other kinds of value indeterminacy have been brought forward in favor of a hybrid view, which incorporates desire- or will-based reasons alongside value-based reasons (Chang 2013). On another kind of view, there are certain moral reasons – such as, for example, the reason involved in the obligation to keep one’s promise – that have to be explained in terms of the voluntary exercise of a normative power to create a reason rather than in terms of the value of the action (Owens 2012; Kiesewetter 2022a).

Morality has provided an especially fertile source of examples and problems for the theory of practical reason. A defining question of moral philosophy is the question of the rational authority of moral norms: to what extent, and under what conditions, do people have compelling reasons to comply with the demands of morality? (Alternatively: to what extent, and under what conditions, are people rationally required to comply with those demands?) Reflection on this question has produced some of the most significant and illuminating philosophical work in the theory of practical reason. One tendency within this body of work is skeptical about the rational authority of moral norms, precisely because they are at odds with the standards to which practical reason is ultimately answerable. A certain kind of Humean, for instance, might question the idea that morality is a source of inescapable or categorical reasons or requirements, arguing that all normative considerations are contingent on the subjective motivations of individual agents, some of whom might just not care about whether their conduct is morally objectionable (Williams 1985, 1989).

Another kind of skepticism is based on the natural idea that practical reason is primarily answerable to norms of prudence, i.e. norms that require agents to be responsive to evaluative facts about what is good for them or what promotes their own well-being (see Fletcher 2021 for discussion of such norms). Thus, on a widely shared picture, moral demands are strictly impartial and often call for significant personal sacrifices, leading to a fundamental conflict between morality and prudential reason (Singer 1972).

Some take this conflict to call into question the rational credentials of moral requirements, precisely because compliance with them is at odds with the agent’s own good (Dorsey 2016). Alternatively, we might follow Sidgwick in postulating a “dualism of practical reason”; this affirms the rational credentials of both prudence and impartial morality, and concedes, pessimistically, that they often pull in different directions (Sidgwick 1907: Bk. 4, Ch. 6; cf. Parfit 2011: Ch. 6). A still different response to this apparent tension is to maintain that it rests on a misinterpretation of the requirements of prudence. Thus it has been argued that, though morality imposes constraints on the direct pursuit of individual utility, these constraints can be justified in the terms of prudential rationality; the strategy of morally-constrained maximization is recommended on grounds of enlightened self-interest, and this in turn accounts for the authority of moral considerations to govern the practical reflection of individuals (Gauthier 1986).

Discussions of the rational credentials of morality are bound up with substantive accounts of the content of moral requirements. Consider utilitarianism and other consequentialist approaches to the normative structure of morality, which interpret moral rightness in terms of the value of the consequences (of actions, policies, institutions, or other objects of moral assessment). On the one hand, many versions of consequentialism exacerbate the apparent conflict between morality and prudence—as Sidgwick saw, the individualized demand to maximize the impartial good seems fundamentally at odds with the prudential imperative to promote one’s own well-being. At the same time, as Sidgwick also discerned, consequentialist interpretations of morality derive at least some of their appeal from the fact that they apply to the moral domain the maximizing model of rationality that seems both familiar and appealing outside of moral contexts (cf. Scheffler 1988). Thus one way to argue for ethical consequentialism is to observe that it is the theory that results when we combine the requirement of maximization with a distinctively moral constraint of impartiality, applying the requirement to a set of preferences that includes those of all the persons (or other sentient creatures) potentially affected by our actions (Harsanyi 1982).

Those who wish to vindicate the rational credentials of morality in the face of skeptical challenges have often taken issue with consequentialist conceptions of the moral (or at least their traditional interpretations). Such views ascribe to us very demanding requirements of impartial benevolence, which leave little scope for the independent significance of the agent’s own projects and interests (Williams 1973). But a more reasonable interpretation of morality might be one that accommodates the independence of the personal point of view (Scheffler 1982), by allowing that moral requirements are sensitive to both moral and prudential considerations (Stroud 1998; Portmore 2011: Ch. 5; Schmidt 2023).

Non-consequentialists typically think of morality as a source of deontological requirements—such as prohibitions on murder and deception—that place constraints on the pursuit of the good, including both the good of the agent and the impartial good. If we wish to vindicate the rational credentials of morality, on this interpretation of it, then we will need to expand our conception of practical reason to include rational requirements very different from the ones that are salient in other domains.

There are two connected features of moral norms that seem particularly significant in this connection. First, they are intuitively understood to include agent-relative reasons for action (Nagel 1978). Thus, if I have promised that I will take you to the airport tomorrow afternoon, this consideration has a significance for me that it does not necessarily have for other agents. In particular, the importance to me of keeping my promise seems to be independent from the impersonal end of promissory fidelity. This shows itself in the fact that my reason to keep the promise I have made would be unaffected if I found myself in a scenario in which breaking my promise would lead five other agents to keep promises they would otherwise have flouted. Second, these agent-relative considerations have a distinctive function within practical deliberation. They are not merely considerations that speak in favor of the actions they recommend, but operate rather as practical requirements that presumptively constrain the agent’s activities. The fact that I have promised to take you to the airport tomorrow, for instance, is ordinarily a decisive basis for concluding that that is to be done. I do not need to weigh this consideration against other values that might be pursued under the circumstances; rather, the promissory commitment enters the deliberative field from the start in the deontic guise of an obligation or a “pre-emptive” or “exclusionary reason” (Raz 1986, 1990; Wallace 2019).

There are divergent approaches that have been taken within ethical theory for making sense of these salient features of moral reasons. Kantians for instance, take rational agents to impose the moral law on themselves when they act, where the law in question functions as a limiting condition on the pursuit of their ends (O’Neill 1989; Korsgaard 1996). Proponents of virtue theory take it that compliance with some agent-centered requirements is partly constitutive of being a good human being (Foot 2001). A still different class of approaches understands moral norms in essentially interpersonal terms: either as demands that are (at least hypothetically) imposed by agents on each other (Darwall 2009), or as relational requirements that define what we owe to each other, and that make possible relations of mutual recognition or regard (Scanlon 1998; Wallace 2019). These are very disparate ways of conceptualizing morality as a sui genesis domain of agent-centered obligations. They have in common, however, a commitment to the idea that reflection on the nature of morality can bring to light structures of practical reason that would not otherwise be salient.

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Acknowledgments

Benjamin Kiesewetter gratefully acknowledges funding by the European Union (ERC Grant 101040439, REASONS F1RST). Views and opinions expressed are however those of the authors only and do not necessarily reflect those of the European Union or the European Research Council Executive Agency. Neither the European Union nor the granting authority can be held responsible for them.

Copyright © 2024 by
R. Jay Wallace <rjw@berkeley.edu>
Benjamin Kiesewetter <benjamin.kiesewetter@uni-bielefeld.de>

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