Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

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Proof of Proposition 2.18

Proposition 2.18.
Let C*N be the greatest fixed point of fE. Then C*N(E) = K*N(E).

Proof.

We have shown that K*N(E) is a fixed point of fE, so we only need to show that K*N(E) is the greatest fixed point. Let B be a fixed point of fB. We want to show that B ⊆ KkN(E) for each value k≥1. We will proceed by induction on k. By hypothesis,

B = fE(B) = K1N(E∩B) ⊆ K1N(E)

by monotonicity, so we have the k=1 case. Now suppose that for k=m, B ⊆ KmN(E). Then by monotonicity,

(i) K1N(B) ⊆ K1N KmN(E) = Km+1N(E)

We also have:

(ii) B = K1N(E∩B) ⊆ K1N(B)

by monotonicity, so combining (i) and (ii) we have:

B ⊆ K1N(B) ⊆ Km+1N(E)

completing the induction. □

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