Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 3.4

Proposition 3.4.
In a game Γ, common knowledge of Bayesian rationality is satisfied if, and only if, (3.i) is common knowledge.

Proof.
Suppose first that common knowledge of Bayesian rationality is satisfied. Since it is common knowledge that agent i knows that agent k is Bayesian rational, it is also common knowledge that if μi(skj) > 0, then skj must be optimal for k given some belief over S-k, so (3.i) is common knowledge.

Suppose now that (3.i) is common knowledge. Then, by (3.i), agent i knows that agent k is Bayesian rational. Since (3.i) is common knowledge, all statements of the form ‘For i, j, … , k ∈ N, i knows that j knows that … is Bayesian rational’ follow by induction. □

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