Notes to Heraclitus

1. Recently Mouraviev, following some earlier editors, has added to the one sentence of B12 the sentence that follows it in its context in Eusebius: “And souls too are nourished by moist exhalations [anathumiôntai].” This would limit the application of the statement about rivers to psychology. But there are problems with this attribution, most notably that the term anathumiaô and its cognates are not attested until Aristotle, and are not the kind of words we find Heraclitus using. Further, other sources such as Plutarch (Natural Questions 912a) seem to take the first sentence as belonging to a cosmological context. And if the sentence were found in an explicitly psychological context, the verbal complexities would be pointless.