Higher-Order Theories of Consciousness

First published Tue Apr 3, 2001; substantive revision Mon Aug 15, 2011

Higher-order theories of consciousness try to explain the distinctive properties of consciousness in terms of some relation obtaining between the conscious state in question and a higher-order representation of some sort (either a higher-order perception of that state, or a higher-order thought or belief about it). The most challenging properties to explain are those involved in phenomenal consciousness—the sort of state that has a subjective dimension, that has ‘feel’, or that it is like something to undergo. These properties will form the focus of this article.

1. Kinds of Consciousness

One of the advances made in the last couple of decades has been to distinguish between different questions concerning consciousness (see particularly: Rosenthal 1986; Dretske 1993; Block 1995; Lycan 1996). Not everyone agrees on quite which distinctions need to be drawn. But all are agreed that we should distinguish creature consciousness from mental-state consciousness. It is one thing to say of an individual person or organism that it is conscious (either in general or of something in particular); and it is quite another thing to say of one of the mental states of a creature that it is conscious.

It is also agreed that within creature-consciousness itself we should distinguish between intransitive and transitive variants. To say of an organism that it is conscious simpliciter (intransitive) is to say just that it is awake, as opposed to asleep or comatose. (At least, this is true on one natural understanding. Others hear the statement as equivalent to saying that there is something that it is like to be the creature.) There don't appear to be any deep philosophical difficulties lurking here (or at least, they aren't difficulties specific to the topic of consciousness, as opposed to mentality in general). But to say of an organism that it is conscious of such-and-such (transitive) is normally to say at least that it is perceiving such-and-such, or aware of such-and-such. So we say of the mouse that it is conscious of the cat outside its hole, in explaining why it doesn't come out; meaning that it perceives the cat's presence. To provide an account of transitive creature-consciousness would thus be to attempt a theory of perception.

There is a choice to be made concerning transitive creature-consciousness, failure to notice which may be a potential source of confusion. For we have to decide whether the perceptual state in virtue of which an organism may be said to be transitively-conscious of something must itself be a conscious one (state-conscious—see below). If we say ‘Yes’ then we shall need to know more about the mouse than merely that it perceives the cat if we are to be assured that it is conscious of the cat—we shall need to establish that its percept of the cat is itself conscious. If we say ‘No’, on the other hand, then the mouse's perception of the cat will be sufficient for the mouse to count as conscious of the cat; but we may have to say that although it is conscious of the cat, the mental state in virtue of which it is so conscious is not itself a conscious one! It may be best to by-pass any danger of confusion here by avoiding the language of transitive-creature-consciousness altogether. Nothing of importance would be lost to us by doing this. We can say simply that organism O observes or perceives X; and we can then assert explicitly, if we wish, that its percept is or is not conscious.

Turning now to the notion of mental-state consciousness, the major distinction here is between phenomenal consciousness, on the one hand—which is a property of states that it is like something to be in, that have a distinctive ‘feel’ (Nagel 1974)—and various functionally-definable forms of access consciousness, on the other (Block 1995). Most theorists believe that there are mental states—such as occurrent thoughts or judgments—that are access-conscious (in whatever is the correct functionally-definable sense), but that are not phenomenally conscious. In contrast, there is considerable dispute as to whether mental states can be phenomenally-conscious without also being conscious in the functionally-definable sense—and even more dispute about whether phenomenal consciousness can be reductively explained in functional and/or representational terms.

It is plain that there is nothing deeply problematic about functionally-definable notions of mental-state consciousness, from a naturalistic perspective. For mental functions and mental representations are the staple fare of naturalistic accounts of the mind. But this leaves plenty of room for dispute about the form that the correct functional account should take. Some claim that for a state to be conscious in the relevant sense is for it to be poised to have an impact on the organism's decision-making processes (Kirk 1994; Dretske 1995; Tye 1995), perhaps also with the additional requirement that those processes should be distinctively rational ones (Block 1995). Others think that the relevant requirement for access-consciousness is that the state should be suitably related to higher-order representations—experiences and/or beliefs—of that very state (Armstrong 1968, 1984; Rosenthal 1986, 1993, 2005; Dennett 1978a, 1991; Carruthers 1996, 2000, 2005; Lycan 1987, 1996).

What is often thought to be naturalistically problematic, in contrast, is phenomenal consciousness (Nagel 1974, 1984; Jackson 1982, 1986; McGinn 1991; Block 1995; Chalmers 1996). And what is really and deeply controversial is whether phenomenal consciousness can be explained in terms of some or other functionally-definable notion. Cognitive (or representational) theories maintain that it can. Higher-order cognitive theories maintain that phenomenal consciousness can be reductively explained in terms of representations (either experiences or beliefs) that are higher-order. It is such theories that concern us here.

2. The Motivation for a Higher-Order Approach

Higher-order theories, like cognitive / representational theories in general, assume that the right level at which to seek an explanation of phenomenal consciousness is a cognitive one, providing an explanation in terms of some combination of causal role and intentional content. All such theories claim that phenomenal consciousness consists in a certain kind of intentional or representational content (analog or ‘fine-grained’ in comparison with any concepts we possess) figuring in a certain distinctive position in the causal architecture of the mind. They must therefore maintain that these latter sorts of mental property don't already implicate or presuppose phenomenal consciousness. In fact, all cognitive accounts are united in rejecting the thesis that the very properties of mind or mentality already presuppose phenomenal consciousness, as proposed by Searle (1992, 1997) for example.

The major divide amongst representational theories of phenomenal consciousness in general, is between accounts that are provided in purely first-order terms and those that implicate higher-order representations of one sort or another (see below). These higher-order theorists will allow that first-order accounts—of the sort defended by Dretske (1995) and Tye (1995), for example—can already make some progress with the problem of consciousness. According to first-order views, phenomenal consciousness consists in analog or fine-grained contents that are available to the first-order processes that guide thought and action. So a phenomenally-conscious percept of red, for example, consists in a state with the analog content red which is tokened in such a way as to feed into thoughts about red, or into actions that are in one way or another guided by redness. Now, the point to note in favor of such an account is that it can explain the natural temptation to think that phenomenal consciousness is in some sense ineffable, or indescribable. This will be because such states have fine-grained contents that can slip through the mesh of any conceptual net. We can always distinguish many more shades of red than we have concepts for, or could describe in language (other than indexically—e.g., ‘That shade’).

The main motivation behind higher-order theories of consciousness, in contrast, derives from the belief that all (or at least most) mental-state types admit of both conscious and unconscious varieties. Almost everyone now accepts, for example, (post-Freud) that beliefs and desires can be activated unconsciously. (Think, here, of the way in which problems can apparently become resolved during sleep, or while one's attention is directed to other tasks. Notice, too, that appeals to unconscious intentional states are now routine in cognitive science.) And then if we ask what makes the difference between a conscious and an unconscious mental state, one natural answer is that conscious states are states that we are aware of. And if awareness is thought to be a form of creature-consciousness (see section 1 above), then this will translate into the view that conscious states are states of which the subject is aware, or states of which the subject is creature-conscious. That is to say, these are states that are the objects of some sort of higher-order representation—whether a higher-order perception or experience, or a higher-order belief or thought. (This is Lycan's ‘simple argument’ for a higher-order representation account of consciousness. See Lycan 2001b.)

One crucial question, then, is whether perceptual states as well as beliefs admit of both conscious and unconscious varieties. Can there be, for example, such a thing as an unconscious visual perceptual state? Higher-order theorists are united in thinking that there can. Armstrong (1968) uses the example of absent-minded driving to make the point. Most of us at some time have had the rather unnerving experience of ‘coming to’ after having been driving on ‘automatic pilot’ while our attention was directed elsewhere—perhaps having been day-dreaming or engaged in intense conversation with a passenger. We were apparently not consciously aware of any of the route we have recently taken, nor of any of the obstacles we avoided on the way. Yet we must surely have been seeing, or we would have crashed the car. Others have used the example of blindsight (Carruthers 1989, 1996). This is a condition in which subjects have had a portion of their primary visual cortex destroyed, and apparently become blind in a region of their visual field as a result. But it has now been known for some time that if subjects are asked to guess at the properties of their ‘blind’ field (e.g. whether it contains a horizontal or vertical grating, or whether it contains an ‘X’ or an ‘O’), they prove remarkably accurate. Subjects can also reach out and grasp objects in their ‘blind’ field with something like 80% or more of normal accuracy, and can catch a ball thrown from their ‘blind’ side, all without conscious awareness. (See Weiskrantz 1986, 1997, for details and discussion.)

More recently, a powerful case for the existence of unconscious visual experience has been generated by the two-systems theory of vision proposed and defended by Milner and Goodale (1995; see also Jacob and Jeannerod 2003; Glover 2004). They review a wide variety of kinds of neurological and neuro-psychological evidence for the substantial independence of two distinct visual systems, instantiated in the temporal and parietal lobes respectively. They conclude that the parietal lobes provide a set of specialized semi-independent modules for the on-line visual control of action; whereas the temporal lobes are primarily concerned with more off-line functions such as visual learning and object recognition. And only the perceptions generated by the temporal-lobe system are phenomenally conscious, on their account.

(Note that this isn't the familiar distinction between what and where visual systems, but is rather a successor to it. For the temporal-lobe system is supposed to have access both to property information and to spatial information. Instead, it is a distinction between a combined what-where system located in the temporal lobes and a how-to or action-guiding system located in the parietal lobes.)

To get the flavor of Milner and Goodale's hypothesis, consider just one strand from the wealth of evidence that they provide. This is a neurological syndrome called visual form agnosia, which results from damage localized to both temporal lobes, leaving primary visual cortex and the parietal lobes intact. (Visual form agnosia is normally caused by carbon monoxide poisoning, for reasons that are little understood.) Such patients cannot recognize objects or shapes, and may be capable of little conscious visual experience; but their sensorimotor abilities remain largely intact.

One particular patient—D.F.—has now been examined in considerable detail. While D.F. is severely agnosic, she isn't completely lacking in conscious visual experience. Her capacities to perceive colors and textures are almost completely preserved. (Why just these sub-modules in her temporal cortex should have been spared isn't known.) As a result, she can sometimes guess the identity of a presented object—recognizing a banana, say, from its yellow color and the distinctive texture of its surface. But she is unable to perceive the shape of the banana (whether straight or curved, say); nor its orientation (upright or horizontal; pointing towards her or across). Yet many of her sensorimotor abilities are close to normal—she would be able to reach out and grasp the banana, orienting her hand and wrist appropriately for its position and orientation, and using a normal and appropriate finger grip. Under experimental conditions it turns out that although D.F. is at chance when identifying the orientation of a broad line or letter-box, she is almost normal when posting a letter through a similarly-shaped slot oriented at random angles. In the same way, although she is at chance when trying to discriminate between rectangular blocks of very different sizes, her reaching and grasping behaviors when asked to pick up such a block are virtually indistinguishable from those of normal controls. It is very hard to make sense of these data without supposing that the sensorimotor perceptual system is functionally and anatomically distinct from the object-recognition/conscious system.

There is a powerful case, then, for thinking that there are unconscious as well as conscious visual percepts. While the perceptions that ground your thoughts when you plan in relation to the perceived environment (‘I'll pick up that one’) may be conscious, and while you will continue to enjoy conscious perceptions of what you are doing while you act, the perceptual states that actually guide the details of your movements when you reach out and grab the object will not be conscious ones, if Milner and Goodale (1995) are correct.

But what implications does this have for phenomenal consciousness? Must these unconscious percepts also be lacking in phenomenal properties? Most people think so. While it may be possible to get oneself to believe that the perceptions of the absent-minded car driver can remain phenomenally conscious (perhaps lying outside of the focus of attention, or being instantly forgotten), it is very hard to believe that either blindsight percepts or D.F.'s sensorimotor perceptual states might be phenomenally conscious ones. For these perceptions are ones to which the subjects of those states are blind, and of which they cannot be aware. And the question, then, is what makes the relevant difference? What is it about a conscious perception that renders it phenomenal, that a blindsight perceptual state would correspondingly lack? Higher-order theorists are united in thinking that the relevant difference consists in the presence of something higher-order in the first case that is absent in the second. The core intuition is that a phenomenally conscious state will be a state of which the subject is aware.

What options does a first-order theorist have to resist this conclusion? One is to deny that the data are as problematic as they appear (as does Dretske 1995). It can be said that the unconscious states in question lack the kind of fineness of grain and richness of content necessary to count as genuinely perceptual states. On this view, the contrast discussed above isn't really a difference between conscious and unconscious perceptions, but rather between conscious perceptions, on the one hand, and unconscious belief-like states, on the other. Another option is to accept the distinction between conscious and unconscious perceptions, and then to explain that distinction in first-order terms. It might be said, for example, that conscious perceptions are those that are available to belief and thought, whereas unconscious ones are those that are available to guide movement (Kirk 1994). A final option is to bite the bullet, and insist that blindsight and sensorimotor perceptual states are indeed phenomenally conscious while not being access-conscious. (See Block 1995; Tye 1995; and Nelkin 1996; all of whom defend versions of this view.) On this account, blindsight percepts are phenomenally conscious states to which the subjects of those states are blind. Higher-order theorists will argue, of course, that none of these alternatives is acceptable (see, e.g., Carruthers 2000).

In a recent review, Lau and Rosenthal (2011) survey the empirical evidence pertaining to the difference between higher-order theories and first-order ones. While much is equivocal, and many questions are left unanswered, they point to a pair of studies that support a higher-order account. One is Lau and Passingham (2006), who are able to demonstrate using carefully controlled stimuli that there are circumstances in which people's subjective reports of visual experience are impaired while their first-order discrimination abilities remain fully intact. They also find that visual consciousness in these conditions is specifically associated with activity in a region of dorsolateral prefrontal cortex. Then in a follow-up study Rounis et al. (2010) find that transcranial magnetic stimulation directed at this region of cortex, thereby disrupting its activity, also has a significant impact on people's meta-visual awareness, but again without impairing first-order task performance.

In general, then, higher-order theories of phenomenal consciousness claim the following:

Higher Order Theory (In General):
A phenomenally conscious mental state is a mental state (of a certain sort—see below) that either is, or is disposed to be, the object of a higher-order representation of a certain sort (see below).

Higher-order theorists will allow, of course, that mental states can be targets of higher-order representation without being phenomenally conscious. For example, a belief can give rise to a higher-order belief without thereby being phenomenally conscious. What is distinctive of phenomenal consciousness is that the states in question should be perceptual or quasi-perceptual ones (e.g. visual images as well as visual percepts). Moreover, most cognitive/representational theorists will maintain that these states must possess a certain kind of analog (fine-grained) or non-conceptual intentional content. What makes perceptual states, mental images, bodily sensations, and emotional feelings phenomenally conscious, on this approach, is that they are conscious states with analog or non-conceptual contents. So putting these points together, we get the view that phenomenally conscious states are those states that possess fine-grained intentional contents of which the subject is aware, being the target or potential target of some sort of higher-order representation.

There are then two main dimensions along which higher-order theorists disagree amongst themselves. One concerns whether the higher-order states in question are perception-like, on the one hand, or belief-like, on the other. Those taking the former option are higher-order perception (often called ‘inner-sense’) theorists, and those taking the latter option are higher-order thought theorists. The other disagreement is internal to higher-order thought approaches, and concerns whether the relevant relation between the first-order state and the higher-order thought is one of availability or not. That is, the question is whether a state is conscious by virtue of being disposed to give rise to a higher-order thought, or rather by virtue of being the actual target of such a thought. These are the three main options that will now concern us. (A fourth will be considered in section 6.)

3. Higher-Order Perception Theory

According to this view, humans not only have first-order non-conceptual and/or analog perceptions of states of their environments and bodies, they also have second-order non-conceptual and/or analog perceptions of their first-order states of perception. And the most popular version of higher-order perception theory holds, in addition, that humans (and perhaps other animals) not only have sense-organs that scan the environment/body to produce fine-grained representations that can then serve to ground thoughts and action-planning, but they also have inner senses, charged with scanning the outputs of the first-order senses (i.e. perceptual experiences) to produce equally fine-grained, but higher-order, representations of those outputs (i.e. to produce higher-order experiences). A version of this view was first proposed by the British Empiricist philosopher John Locke (1690). In our own time it has been defended especially by Armstrong (1968, 1984) and by Lycan (1996).

While it is this inner-sense theory that will be under discussion for most of the present section, it should be noted that this isn't, actually, the only form of higher-order perception theory on the market. As we will see in section 6, there are variants of the view that reject any appeal to organs of inner sense. Likewise (as we shall see in section 5) there are versions of higher-order thought (HOT) account that also implicate higher-order perceptions without needing to appeal to inner sense.

A terminological point: ‘inner-sense theory’ should more strictly be called ‘higher-order-sense theory’, since we of course have senses that are physically ‘inner’, such as pain-perception and internal touch-perception, that aren't intended to fall under its scope. For these are first-order senses on a par with vision and hearing, differing only in that their purpose is to detect properties of the body, rather than of the external world (Hill 2004). According to the sort of higher-order theory that is presently under discussion, these senses, too, will need to have their outputs scanned to produce higher-order analog contents in order for those outputs to become phenomenally conscious. In what follows, however, the term ‘inner sense’ will be used to mean, more strictly, ‘higher-order sense’, since this terminology is now pretty firmly established.

We therefore have the following proposal to consider:

Inner-Sense Theory:
A phenomenally conscious mental state is a state with analog/non-conceptual intentional content, which is in turn the target of a higher-order analog/non-conceptual intentional state, via the operations of a faculty of ‘inner sense’.

On this account, the difference between a phenomenally conscious percept of red and the sort of unconscious percepts of red that guide the guesses of a blindsighter and the activity of the sensorimotor system, is as follows. The former is scanned by our inner senses to produce a higher-order analog state with the content experience of red or seems red, whereas the latter states aren't—they remain merely first-order states with the analog content red; and in so remaining, they lack any dimension of seeming or subjectivity. According to inner-sense theory, it is the higher-order perceptual contents produced by the operations of our inner-senses that make some mental states with analog contents, but not others, available to their subjects. And it is these same higher-order contents that constitute the subjective dimension or ‘feel’ of the former set of states, thus rendering them phenomenally conscious.

One of the main advantages of inner-sense theory is that it can explain how it is possible for us to acquire purely recognitional concepts of experience. For if we possess higher-order perceptual contents, then it should be possible for us to learn to recognize the occurrence of our own perceptual states immediately—or ‘straight off’—grounded in those higher-order analog contents. (Compare the way in which first-order perceptual contents representing color and sound enable us the acquire first-order recognitional concepts for colors and sounds.) And this should be possible without those recognitional concepts thereby having any conceptual connections with our beliefs about the nature or content of the states recognized, nor with any of our surrounding mental concepts. This is then how inner-sense theory will claim to explain the familiar philosophical thought-experiments concerning one's own experiences, which are supposed to cause such problems for physicalist/naturalistic accounts of the mind (Kripke 1972; Chalmers 1996). (For discussion of this ‘phenomenal concept strategy’ see Carruthers and Veillet 2007.)

For example, I can think, ‘R [an experience as of red] might have occurred in me, or might normally occur in others, in the absence of any of its actual causes and effects.’ So on any view of intentional content that sees content as tied to normal causes (i.e. to information carried) and/or to normal effects (i.e. to teleological or inferential role), experience of type R might occur without representing red. Likewise I can think, ‘R might occur in someone without occupying the role of experience, but rather (say) of belief.’ In the same sort of way, I shall be able to think, ‘P [an experience of pain] might have occurred in me, or might occur in others, in the absence of any of the usual causes and effects of pain. There could be someone in whom P experiences occur but who isn't bothered by them, and where those experiences are never caused by tissue damage or other forms of bodily insult. And conversely, there could be someone who behaves and acts just as I do when in pain, and in response to the same physical causes, but who is never subject to P types of experience.’ If we possess purely recognitional concepts of experience such as R and P, grounded in higher-order percepts of those experiences, then the thinkability of such thoughts is both readily explicable, and apparently unthreatening to a naturalistic approach to the mind.

Inner sense theorists are thus especially well placed to respond to those who claim that there is an unbridgeable explanatory gap between all physical, functional, and intentional facts, on the one hand, and the facts of phenomenal consciousness, on the other (Levine 1983; Chalmers 1996). And likewise they can explain the conceivability of zombies without becoming committed to the existence of any non-physical properties of experience (contra Chalmers 1996). In each case it is the conceptual isolation of our higher-order recognitional concepts of experience that explains how there can be no a priori entailment between physical, functional, and intentional facts and the occurrence of states of type R or P (where R and P express purely recognitional concepts).

(First-order representationalists, too, have appealed to the special character of our phenomenal concepts to block the standard anti-naturalist arguments (e.g. Tye 2000). But it has been argued that they cannot do so effectively without appealing to the resources provided by higher-order theories of phenomenal consciousness (see Carruthers 2005, ch.5).)

Inner-sense theory does face a number of difficulties, however. One objection is as follows (see Dretske 1995, Güzeldere 1995). If inner-sense theory were true, then how is it that there isn't any phenomenology distinctive of inner sense, in the way that there is a phenomenology associated with each outer sense? Since each of the outer senses gives rise to a distinctive set of phenomenological properties, one might expect that if there were such a thing as inner sense, then there would also be a phenomenology distinctive of its operation. But there doesn't appear to be any.

This point turns on the so-called ‘transparency’ of our perceptual experience (Harman 1990). Concentrate as hard as you like on your ‘outer’ (first-order) experiences—you won't find any further phenomenological properties arising out of the attention you pay to them, beyond those already belonging to the contents of the experiences themselves. Paying close attention to your experience of the color of the red rose, for example, just produces attention to the redness—a property of the rose. But put like this, however, the objection just seems to beg the question in favor of first-order theories of phenomenal consciousness. It assumes that first-order—‘outer’—perceptions already have a phenomenology independently of their targeting by inner sense. But this is just what an inner-sense theorist will deny. And then in order to explain the absence of any kind of higher-order phenomenology, an inner-sense theorist only needs to maintain that our higher-order perceptions are never themselves targeted by an inner-sense-organ which might produce third-order analog representations of them in turn.

Another objection to inner-sense theory is as follows (see Sturgeon 2000). If there really were an organ of inner sense, then it ought to be possible for it to malfunction, just as our first-order senses sometimes do. And in that case, it ought to be possible for someone to have a first-order percept with the analog content red causing a higher-order percept with the analog content seems-orange. Someone in this situation would be disposed to judge, ‘It's red’, immediately and non-inferentially (i.e. not influenced by beliefs about the object's normal color or their own physical state). But at the same time they would be disposed to judge, ‘It seems orange’. Not only does this sort of thing never apparently occur, but the idea that it might do so conflicts with a powerful intuition. This is that our awareness of our own experiences is immediate, in such a way that to believe that you are undergoing an experience of a certain sort is to be undergoing an experience of that sort. But if inner-sense theory is correct, then it ought to be possible for someone to believe that they are in a state of seeming-orange when they are actually in a state of seeming-red.

A different sort of objection to inner-sense theory is developed by Carruthers (2000). It starts from the fact that the internal monitors postulated by such theories would need to have considerable computational complexity in order to generate the requisite higher-order experiences. In order to perceive an experience, the organism would need to have mechanisms to generate a set of internal representations with an analog or non-conceptual content representing the content of that experience, in all its richness and fine-grained detail. And notice that any inner scanner would have to be a physical device (just as the visual system itself is) which depends upon the detection of those physical events in the brain that are the outputs of the various sensory systems (just as the visual system is a physical device that depends upon detection of physical properties of surfaces via the reflection of light). For it is hard to see how any inner scanner could detect the presence of an experience qua experience. Rather, it would have to detect the physical realizations of experiences in the brain, and construct the requisite higher-order representation of the experiences that those physical events realize, on the basis of that physical-information input. This makes is seem inevitable that the scanning device that supposedly generates higher-order experiences of our first-order visual experience would have to be almost as sophisticated and complex as the visual system itself.

Now the problem that arises here is this. Given this complexity in the operations of our organs of inner sense, there had better be some plausible story to tell about the evolutionary pressures that led to their construction. For natural selection is the only theory that can explain the existence of organized functional complexity in nature (Pinker 1994, 1997). But there would seem to be no such stories on the market. The most plausible suggestion is that inner-sense might have evolved to subserve our capacity to think about the mental states of conspecifics, thus enabling us to predict their actions and manipulate their responses. (This is the so-called ‘Machiavellian hypothesis’ to explain the evolution of intelligence in the great-ape lineage. See Byrne and Whiten 1988, 1998; and see Goldman 2006, for a view of inner sense of this sort.) But this suggestion presupposes that the organism must already have some capacity for higher-order thought, since it is such thoughts that inner sense is supposed to subserve. And yet as we shall see shortly (in section 5), some higher-order thought theories can claim all of the advantages of inner-sense theory as an explanation of phenomenal consciousness, but without the need to postulate any ‘inner scanners’. At any rate, the ‘computational complexity objection’ to inner-sense theories remains as a challenge to be answered.

4. Higher-Order Thought Theory (1): Actualist

Actualist higher-order thought (HOT) theory is a proposal about the nature of state-consciousness in general, of which phenomenal consciousness is but one species. Its main proponent has been Rosenthal (1986, 1993, 2005). The proposal is this: a conscious mental state M, of mine, is a state that is actually causing an activated belief (generally a non-conscious one) that I have M, and causing it non-inferentially. (The qualification concerning non-inferential causation will be discussed in a moment.) An account of phenomenal consciousness can then be generated by stipulating that the mental state M should have a causal role and/or content of a certain distinctive sort in order to count as an experience (e.g., with an analog content, perhaps), and that when M is an experience (or a mental image, bodily sensation, or emotional feeling), it will be phenomenally conscious when (and only when) suitably targeted.

We therefore have the following proposal to consider:

Actualist Higher-Order Thought Theory:
A phenomenally conscious mental state is a state of a certain sort (e.g. with analog/non-conceptual intentional content, perhaps) which is the object of a higher-order thought, and which causes that thought non-inferentially.

It should be noted that Rosenthal himself interprets the non-inferential requirement as ruling out only conscious inferences in the generation of a consciousness-making higher-order thought. This enables him to avoid having to say that my unconscious motives become conscious when I learn of them under psychoanalysis, or that my jealousy is conscious when I learn of it by noticing and interpreting my own behavior. But Rosenthal (2005) thinks that unconscious self-interpretation is acceptable as a source of the conscious status of the states thereby attributed. So if I arrive at the belief that I am feeling cheerful by unconsciously noticing the spring in my own step and the smile on my own face and drawing an unconscious inference, my cheerfulness will thereby have been rendered conscious. Many find this claim to be unfortunate, since it destroys the intuitive contrast between self-knowledge and other-knowledge of conscious states—we surely think that our access to our own conscious states is quite different from our access to the conscious states of other people. This aspect of Rosenthal's actualist form of HOT theory would appear to be optional for a HOT theorist, however.

In addition, Rosenthal (2005) thinks that the occurrence of a suitably caused HOT is sufficient for consciousness, even in the absence of any targeted first-order state. So I am undergoing a conscious experience of red provided that I believe that I am undergoing an experience of red, even if I am actually in no first-order perceptual state whatever. This aspect of Rosenthal's views, too, appears optional for an actualist HOT theorist. Such a theorist can—and perhaps should—insist that phenomenally conscious experience occurs when and only when a first-order perceptual state causes a higher-order belief in the existence of that state in a way that doesn't depend upon self-interpretation.

The actualist HOT account avoids some of the difficulties inherent in inner-sense theory, while retaining the latter's ability to explain the distinction between conscious and unconscious perceptions. (Conscious perceptions will be analog states that are targeted by a higher-order thought, whereas perceptions such as those involved in blindsight will be unconscious by virtue of not being so targeted.) In particular, it is easy to see a function for higher-order thoughts, in general, and to tell a story about their likely evolution. A capacity to entertain higher-order thoughts about experiences would enable a creature to negotiate the is/seems distinction, perhaps learning not to trust its own experiences in certain circumstances, and also to induce appearances in others, by deceit. And a capacity to entertain higher-order thoughts about thoughts (beliefs and desires) would enable a creature to reflect on, and to alter, its own beliefs and patterns of reasoning, as well as to predict and manipulate the thoughts and behaviors of others. Indeed, it can plausibly be claimed that it is our capacity to target higher-order thoughts on our own mental states that underlies our status as rational agents (Burge 1996; Sperber 1996).

One well-known objection to this sort of higher-order thought theory is due to Dretske (1993). We are asked to imagine a case in which we carefully examine two line-drawings, say (or in Dretske's example, two patterns of differently-sized spots). These drawings are similar in almost all respects, but differ in just one aspect—in Dretske's example, one of the pictures contains a black spot that the other lacks. It is surely plausible that, in the course of examining these two pictures, one will have enjoyed a conscious visual experience of the respect in which they differ—e.g. of the offending spot. But, as is familiar, one can be in this position while not knowing that the two pictures are different, or in what way they are different. In which case, since one can have a conscious experience (e.g. of the spot) without being aware that one is having it, consciousness cannot require higher-order awareness.

Replies to this objection have been made by Seager (1994), Byrne (1997), and Rosenthal (2005), among others. They point out that it is one thing to have a conscious experience of the aspect that differentiates the two pictures, and quite another to consciously experience that the two pictures are differentiated by that aspect. That is, consciously seeing the extra spot in one picture needn't mean seeing that this is the difference between the two pictures. So while scanning the two pictures one will enjoy conscious experience of the extra spot. A higher-order thought theorist will say that this means undergoing a percept with the content spot here that forms the target of a higher-order belief that one is undergoing a perception with that content. But this can perfectly well be true without one undergoing a percept with the content spot here in this picture but absent here in that one. And it can also be true without one forming any higher-order belief to the effect that one is undergoing a perception with the content spot here when looking at a given picture but not when looking at the other. In which case the purported counter-example isn't really a counter-example.

Another objection to actualist HOT theory is epistemological, and is due to Goldman (2000). It turns crucially on the fact that the consciousness-making higher-order thoughts postulated by the theory are, themselves, characteristically unconscious. The objection goes like this. When I undergo a conscious mental state M, I generally know, or have good reason to believe, that M is conscious. (When I have a conscious pain, I surely know that the pain is conscious.) But how can this be, if what makes M conscious is the existence of an unconscious higher-order thought targeted on M? Since I don't know that this thought exists, it seems that I shouldn't be able to know that M is conscious, either.

As Goldman himself acknowledges, however, this argument can only really work on the assumption that actualist HOT theory is supposed to be some sort of analytic or logical truth. (Compare: how could you know that Sydney is a bachelor if you didn't know that Sydney is unmarried, or that Sydney is male?) Rosenthal has always made clear, however, that the theory isn't intended to be a piece of conceptual analysis, but is rather an account of the properties that constitute the property of being conscious (see Rosenthal 1986, as well as his 2005). And the epistemological argument gets no traction against this sort of view. For compare: of course you can know that there is water in the glass without knowing that there is H2O in the glass, although water is constituted of H2O. Likewise, then, you can know that your experience is conscious without knowing that your experience is being targeted by a higher-order thought, even though consciousness is constituted by a relationship to such thoughts. Goldman (2000) remarks that although the epistemological argument doesn't refute Rosenthal's actual view, it does undermine ‘a very close relative of it’. Rosenthal could reply, however, that the two sorts of theory aren't close relatives at all. It is one thing to provide an analysis of the concept of consciousness, and quite another thing to propose an empirical theory of the properties that constitute consciousness. (Compare analyzing the meaning of ‘water’ with discovering that water is H2O.) Goldman also remarks that if actualist HOT theory isn't itself intended as a conceptual analysis of consciousness, then we are owed such an analysis elsewhere in the theory. But this is far from obvious. Most theorists think that the concept of phenomenal consciousness can't really be analyzed or defined at all, and many think that the best that one can do by way of explanation is to exhibit examples (see Block 1995).

A different sort of problem with the actualist version of higher-order thought theory relates to the huge number of beliefs that would have to be caused by any given phenomenally conscious experience. (This is the analogue of the ‘computational complexity’ objection to inner-sense theory, sketched in section 3 above). Consider just how rich and detailed a conscious experience can be. It would seem that there can be an immense amount of which we can be consciously aware at any one time. Imagine looking down on a city from a window high up in a tower-block, for example. In such a case you can have phenomenally conscious percepts of a complex distribution of trees, roads, and buildings; colors on the ground and in the sky above; moving cars and pedestrians; and so on. And you can—it seems—be conscious of all of this simultaneously. According to actualist higher-order thought theory, then, you would need to have a distinct activated higher-order belief for each distinct aspect of your experience—either that, or just a few such beliefs with immensely complex contents. Either way, the objection is the same. For it seems implausible that all of this higher-order activity should be taking place (albeit non-consciously) every time someone is the subject of a complex conscious experience. For what would be the point? And think of the amount of cognitive/neural space that these beliefs would take up! (In contrast, we know that neural tissue and activity are expensive; see Aiello and Wheeler 1995; and we also know that as a result of such constraints, the wiring diagram for the brain is about as efficient as it is possible for it to be; see Cherniak et al. 2004.)

This objection to actualist forms of higher-order thought theory is considered at some length in Carruthers (2000), where a variety of possible replies are discussed and evaluated. Perhaps the most plausible and challenging such reply would be to deny the main premise lying behind the objection, concerning the rich and integrated nature of phenomenally conscious experience. Rather, the theory could align itself with Dennett's (1991) conception of consciousness as highly fragmented, with multiple streams of perceptual content being processed in parallel in different regions of the brain, and with no stage at which all of these contents are routinely integrated into a phenomenally conscious perceptual manifold. Rather, contents become conscious on a piecemeal basis, as a result of internal or external probing that gives rise to a higher-order belief about the content in question. (Dennett himself sees this process as essentially linguistic, with both probes and higher-order thoughts being formulated in natural language. This variant of the view, although important in its own right, is not relevant to our present concerns.) This serves to convey to us the mere illusion of riches, because wherever we direct our attention, there we find a conscious perceptual content.

It is doubtful whether this sort of ‘fragmentist’ account can really explain the phenomenology of our experience, however. For it still faces the objection that the objects of attention can be immensely rich and varied at any given moment, hence requiring there to be an equally rich and varied repertoire of higher-order thoughts tokened at the same time. Think of immersing yourself in the colors and textures of a Van Gogh painting, for example, or the scene as you look out at your garden—it would seem that one can be phenomenally conscious of a highly complex set of properties, which one could not even begin to describe or conceptualize in any detail. However, since the issues here are large and controversial, it cannot yet be concluded that actualist forms of higher-order thought theory have been decisively refuted.

Another difficulty for actualist forms of HOT theory takes the form of a puzzle: how can the targeting of a perceptual state by higher-order thought make the former ‘light up’, and acquire the properties of ‘feel’ or what it is like-ness? Suppose, for example, that I am undergoing an unconscious perception of red. How could such a percept then acquire the properties distinctive of phenomenal consciousness merely by virtue of me coming to believe (in non-inferential fashion) that I am undergoing an experience of red?

Rosenthal (2005) replies to this objection by pointing to cases in which (he says) the acquisition and application of novel higher-order concepts to our experience transforms the phenomenal properties of the latter. Thus a course in wine-tasting can lead me to have experiences of the wine that are phenomenally quite distinct from any that I enjoyed previously. And a course in classical music appreciation might lead to changes in my experience of the sound of the orchestra, perhaps distinguishing between the sounds of the oboes and the clarinets for the first time. Since changes in higher-order concepts can lead to changes in phenomenal consciousness, Rosenthal thinks, it is plausible that it is the presence of higher-order thoughts targeting our perceptual states that is responsible for the latter's phenomenal properties tout court.

In response, an opponent of the theory might observe that the concepts that one acquires in such cases appear not to be higher-order ones at all. Thus the concepts oaky and tanniny that one acquires when wine-tasting pick out secondary qualities of the wine (which are first-order), not higher-order properties of our experience of the wine. And likewise the concept oboe when applied in an experience is a first-order concept of a sound type, not a higher-order concept of one's experience of sound. The phenomenon here is quite general: acquiring and applying new concepts in one's perception can transform the similarity spaces and organization of one's perceptual states. (Think here of the familiar duck/rabbit.) But it appears to be a first-order phenomenon, not a higher-order one. At any rate, there is considerable work for a HOT theorist to do here in making out the case to the contrary.

5. Higher-Order Thought Theory (2): Dispositionalist

According to all forms of dispositionalist higher-order thought theory, the conscious status of an perceptual state consists in its availability to higher-order thought (Dennett 1978a; Carruthers 1996, 2000, 2005). As with the non-dispositionalist version of the theory, in its simplest form we have here a quite general proposal concerning the conscious status of any type of occurrent mental state, which becomes an account of phenomenal consciousness when the states in question are experiences (or images, emotions, etc.) with analog content. The proposal is this: a conscious mental event M, of mine, is one that is disposed to cause an activated belief (generally a non-conscious one) that I have M, and to cause it non-inferentially.

The proposal before us is therefore as follows:

Dispositionalist Higher-Order Thought Theory:
A phenomenally conscious mental state is a state of a certain sort (perhaps with analog/non-conceptual intentional content, and perhaps held in a special-purpose short-term memory store) which is available to cause (non-inferentially) higher-order thoughts about itself (or perhaps about any of the contents of the memory store).

In contrast with the actualist form of theory, the higher-order thoughts that render a percept conscious are not necessarily actual, but potential, on this account. So the objection now disappears, that an unbelievable amount of cognitive space would have to be taken up with every conscious experience. (There need not actually be any higher-order thought occurring, in order for a given perceptual state to count as phenomenally conscious, on this view.) So we can retain our belief in the rich and integrated nature of phenomenally conscious experience—we just have to suppose that all of the contents in question are simultaneously available to higher-order thought. (Such availability might be realized by the ‘global broadcast’ of perceptual representations to a wide range of conceptual systems in the brain, for drawing inferences, for forming memories, and for planning, as well as for forming higher-order beliefs. See Baars 1988, 1997, 2002.) Nor will there be any problem in explaining why our faculty of higher-order thought should have evolved, nor why it should have access to perceptual contents in the first place—this can be the standard sort of story in terms of Machiavellian intelligence.

It might well be wondered how their mere availability to higher-order thoughts could confer on our perceptual states the positive properties distinctive of phenomenal consciousness—that is, of states having a subjective dimension, or a distinctive subjective feel. The answer may lie in the theory of content. Suppose that one agrees with Millikan (1984) that the representational content of a state depends, in part, upon the powers of the systems that consume that state. That is, suppose one thinks that what a state represents will depend, in part, on the kinds of inferences that the cognitive system is prepared to make in the presence of that state, or on the kinds of behavioral control that it can exert. In that case the presence of first-order perceptual representations to a consumer-system that can deploy a ‘theory of mind’, and that is capable of recognitional applications of theoretically-embedded concepts of experience, may be sufficient to render those representations at the same time as higher-order ones. This would be what confers on our phenomenally conscious experiences the dimension of subjectivity. Each experience would at the same time (while also representing some state of the world, or of our own bodies) be a representation that we are undergoing just such an experience, by virtue of the powers of the ‘theory of mind’ consumer-system. Each percept of green, for example, would at one and the same time be an analog representation of green and an analog (non-conceptual) representation of seems green or experience of green. In fact, the attachment of a ‘theory of mind’ faculty to our perceptual systems may completely transform the contents of the latter's outputs.

(Consumer semantics embraces not only a number of different varieties of teleosemantics, but also various forms of inferential role semantics. For the former, see Millikan 1984, 1986, 1989; and Papineau 1987, 1993. For the latter, see Loar 1981, 1982; McGinn 1982, 1989; Block 1986; and Peacocke 1986, 1992. Note that according to both varieties of consumer semantics, the content of a state depends upon its disposition to give rise to certain effects within the consumer systems, rather than upon the actual occurrence of such effects.)

As an independent illustration of how consumer systems can transform perceptual contents, consider prosthetic vision (Bach-y-Rita 1995; Bach-y-Rita and Kercel 2003). Blind subjects can be fitted with a device that transduces the output from a hand-held or head-mounted video-camera into patterns of electrically-induced tactile stimulation across the subject's back or tongue. Initially, of course, the subjects just feel patterns of gentle tickling sensations spreading over the area in question, while the camera scans what is in front of them. But provided that they are allowed to control the movements of the camera themselves, their experiences after a time acquire three-dimensional distal intentional contents, representing the positions and movements of objects in space. (Note that it isn't just that subjects learn to draw spatial inferences from the patterns of tactile stimulation; it is that those patterns themselves become imbued with spatial content. The subjects in question say that it has come to seem to them that there is a spherical object moving towards them, for example.) Here everything on the input side remains the same as it was when subjects first began to wear the device; but the planning and action-controlling systems have learned to interpret those states differently. And as a result, the subjects’ first-order intentional perceptual contents have become quite different. Likewise, according to dispositional HOT theory, when the ‘theory of mind’ system has learned to interpret the subject's perceptual states as perceptual states: they all acquire a dimension of seeming or subjectivity.

Proponents of this account hold that it achieves all of the benefits of inner-sense theory, but without the associated costs. (Some potential draw-backs will be noted in a moment.) In particular, we can endorse the claim that phenomenal consciousness consists in a set of higher-order perceptions. This enables us to explain, not only the difference between conscious and unconscious perception, but also how analog states come to acquire a subjective dimension or ‘feel’. And we can also explain how it can be possible for us to acquire some purely recognitional concepts of experience (thus explaining the standard philosophical thought-experiments concerning zombies and such-like). But we don't have to appeal to the existence of any ‘inner scanners’ or organs of inner sense (together with their associated problems) in order to do this. Moreover, it should also be obvious why there can be no question of our higher-order contents getting out of line with their first-order counterparts, in such a way that one might be disposed to make recognitional judgments of red and seems orange at the same time. This is because the content of the higher-order experience is parasitic on the content of the first-order one, being formed from it by virtue of the latter's availability to a ‘theory of mind’ system.

On the downside, the account isn't neutral on questions of semantic theory. On the contrary, it requires us to reject any form of pure input semantics, in favor of some sort of consumer semantics. We cannot then accept that intentional content reduces to informational content, nor that it can be explicated purely in terms of causal co-variance relations to the environment. So anyone who finds such views attractive will think that the account is a hard one to swallow. (For discussion of various different versions of input semantics, see Dretske 1981, 1986; Fodor 1987, 1990; and Loewer and Rey 1991.)

Moreover, Rosenthal (2005) has objected that dispositional HOT theory can't account for our awareness of our conscious mental states, since mere dispositions to entertain thoughts doesn't make us aware of anything. Two replies can be made (see Carruthers 2000, 2005). One is that, in virtue of our disposition to entertain higher-order thoughts about it, a perceptual state will already possess an analog higher-order content. It is this content that makes us aware of the experience in question. But the second reply is that there does, in any case, seem to be a perfectly good dispositional sense of ‘know’ and ‘aware’. As Dennett pointed out long ago (1978b), I can be said to know, or to be aware, that zebras in the wild don't wear overcoats, even though I have never actually considered the matter, because I am disposed to assent to that proposition in light of what I occurrently know.

In addition, Rowlands (2001) and Jehle and Kriegel (2006) have objected that dispositional HOT theory can't explain the sense in which the phenomenal properties of experience are categorical. For the higher-order analog intentional contents that our conscious perceptual states possess—and that are identified with the ‘feel’ of experience—are said to be constituted by the dispositional property that such states have, of giving rise to higher-order thoughts about themselves. This objection, however, appears to beg the question in favor of irreducible and intrinsic qualia as an account of the distinctive properties of phenomenally conscious states. In any case it doesn't seem to be an objection against dispositional HOT theory as such, since it will count equally against any representationalist theory of consciousness. (For example, Tye 1995, explains consciousness in terms of the poisedness of perceptual states to have an impact on belief and reasoning, which is a dispositional notion.) Any theory that proposes to reductively explain phenomenal consciousness in terms of some combination of intentional content and causal role will be explaining consciousness in terms that are at least partly dispositional. Moreover, there can surely be intentional-level explanations involving categorical properties even if some form of consumer semantics is correct, and so even if the states in question are partly dispositionally constituted.

A well-known objection to dispositionalist higher-order thought theory, however, is that it may have to deny phenomenal consciousness to most species of non-human animal. This objection will be discussed, among others, in section 7, since it can arguably also be raised against any form of higher-order theory.

6. Self-Representational Higher-Order Theories

The two most familiar forms of higher-order theory postulate the existence of a pair of distinct mental states: a first-order perceptual or quasi-perceptual state with a given content, and a higher-order thought or perception representing the presence of that first-order state, thereby rendering it conscious. Either one of these states can occur without the other, although there may be a reliable causal relation between them, such that certain types of first-order perception (e.g. attended outputs of the temporal-lobe visual system) regularly cause higher-order representations of themselves to be formed. In recent years, however, a cluster of different proposals have been made that would reject this independent-state assumption. Rather, the relationship between the conscious state in question and the higher-order state is said to be constitutive, or internal. (See Kriegel 2006, for a useful review; and see Kriegel and Williford 2006, for a number of proposals along these lines.) I shall refer to these as ‘self-representational’ higher-order theories. (Kriegel himself coins the term ‘same-order monitoring theory’. But this is potentially misleading. The theories in question are higher-order, not same-order.)

We therefore have the following proposal to consider:

Self-Representational Higher-Order Theory:
A phenomenally conscious mental state is a state of a certain sort (perhaps with analog/non-conceptual intentional content) which also, at the same time, possesses a higher-order intentional content, thereby in some sense representing itself to the person who is the subject of that state.

There are two basic types of self-representational theory, depending on whether the constitutive relation between the conscious state and the higher-order state is one of identity, on the one hand, or part-whole, on the other. According to the former type of account, it is one and the same perceptual state that is both first-order (representing the world to us) and higher-order (presenting itself to us). (Caston 2002, argues that Aristotle had a theory of conscious perception of this sort.) Kriegel (2006) claims that such accounts are mysterious from a naturalistic perspective, and discusses them no further. But Carruthers (2000, 2005) and perhaps also Van Gulick (2001, 2004) purport to provide naturalistic explanations of just this sort of view. According to Carruthers, a first-order perceptual state with analog content acquires, at the same time, a higher-order analog content by virtue of its availability to a ‘theory of mind’ faculty, together with the truth of some suitable form of consumer semantics (as explained in section 5 above; indeed, Carruthers has taken to calling his view ‘dual-content theory’ rather than ‘dispositional higher-order thought theory’ to emphasize that this is the core of the account). Van Gulick can be interpreted as defending a similar view, which likewise relies on a form of consumer semantics / functional role semantics, which he labels a ‘Higher-Order Global State (HOGS) theory’. On this account, globally broadcast first-order perceptual states acquire at the same time a higher-order seeming dimension though their availability to, and incorporation into, higher-order models of the self and its relation to the perceived environment. (What isn't entirely clear is whether Van Gulick thinks that the resulting perceptual state is the HOG state, or is rather a component part of the HOG state—in which case he would be advocating a kind of part-whole self-representational account.)

Some varieties of part-whole self-representational theory take the same general form as actualist kinds of HOT theory, in which a first-order perceptual state with the content analog-red (as it might be) gives rise to a higher-order belief that one is experiencing red. But rather than claiming that it is the first-order perception that becomes phenomenally conscious because of the presence of the higher-order belief, what is said that the complex state made up of both the first-order perception and the higher-order belief becomes conscious. (Gennaro 1996, defends a view of this sort.) As Kriegel (2006) points out, however, it is unclear how this theory could offer any substantive benefits not already obtainable from actualist HOT theory. Moreover, on the downside, the account has to let go of the intuition that a conscious mental state is one of which the subject is aware. Rather, what will be said is that a conscious state is one that contains two parts, one of which is an awareness of the other.

Kriegel himself (2003, 2006, 2009) and (as Kriegel interprets him) Van Gulick (2001, 2004) emphasize that the first-order perception and the higher-order judgment need to be integrated with one another in order for the resulting complex state to be phenomenally conscious. Kriegel argues that there needs to be a kind of integration resulting from a psychologically real process (as opposed to a theorist's definition) in order for the resulting state to have causal powers that differ from those of the first-order state / higher-order state pair.

Kriegel and Van Gulick do not give fully developed accounts of just why the integration of first-order perceptions with higher-order judgments should give rise to the properties that are distinctive of phenomenal consciousness. But one plausible reconstruction is as follows, modeled on the way that the conceptualization of analog (non-conceptual) first-order perceptual content can transform the latter's properties. Consider, for example, the familiar duck/rabbit. When someone sees this figure for the first time she may just experience a complex of curved lines, representing nothing. But when she comes to see it as a rabbit, those lines take on a certain distinctive organization (the figure now has both a front and a back, for example), thereby transforming the represented properties of the figure. Arguably what happens in such cases is that the conceptual systems succeed in deploying a recognitional template for the concept rabbit, finding a ‘best match’ with the incoming non-conceptual representations. Indeed, there is reason to think that just such a process routinely takes place in perception, with conceptual systems seeking matches against incoming data, and with the resulting states possessing contents that integrate both conceptual and non-conceptual (analog) representations (Kosslyn 1994; Carruthers 2000). The result is a single perceptual state that represents both a particular analog shape and a rabbit. Now suppose that when such states are globally broadcast and are made available to the systems responsible for higher-order thought, a similar process takes place. Those systems bring to bear the concept experience or the concept seeing to produce a further integrated perceptual state. This single state will not only have first-order contents representing the lines on the page, and representing a rabbit, they will also have a higher-order content representing that one is experiencing something rabbit-like. Hence the perceptual state in question becomes ‘self-presenting’, and acquires, as part of its content, a dimension of seeming or subjectivity.

Picciuto (2011) points out, however, that Kriegel's form of self-representational theory still permits a mis-match between the first-order and higher-order components of the integrated state. For there seems to be nothing in the structure of the account to rule out the possibility of a first-order analog content green becoming integrated with the higher-order judgment I am experiencing yellow, for example. It will then be a challenge for the theory to explain whether, and why, the resulting experience has the feel of an experience of green or the feel of an experience of yellow. (Surely it will not have both.)

In order to avoid this difficulty, Picciuto (2011) proposes an alternative form of part-whole self-representational theory. He does so by appropriating, and deploying for a novel purpose, the idea of a quotational phenomenal concept, originally introduced by Papineau (2002) and Balog (2009) as part of their defense of physicalism against the arguments of Chalmers (1996) and others. Picciuto's idea is that the relevant sort of complex self-representational state will consist of a first-order perceptual content combined with a higher-order concept like experience that embeds, or ‘quotes’ that very perceptual content. Given this structure, it will be impossible that there should be a mis-match between the two. For the higher-order component of the complex state is not a judgment about the experience component (which would permit them to be mis-matched) but rather a concept that quotes the experience component.

All part-whole self-representational accounts differ from the dual-content theory of Carruthers (2000, 2005) in the following way, however: on Carruthers’ account, the end-product can be entirely non-conceptual. And in particular, the higher-order content possessed by a conscious percept is a non-conceptual one, representing a seeming of the first-order content of the state by virtue of its availability to higher-order consumer systems. On all of the part-whole accounts sketched above, in contrast, a conscious perception is always partially conceptual, containing the higher-order concept experience (or something similar) as part of its content. There are probably multiple dimensions along which these two sorts of theory could be compared, and each may have its own advantages. But it is worth noting that part-whole accounts will be less well able to explain how we can possess purely recognitional concepts of experience. In particular, on such accounts it would seem that it must always be incoherent to entertain a thought like ‘R might (in some other world) not even have been an experience’. For there will be a direct conflict with the concept experience that is deployed in the content of the state in question.

7. Objections to a Higher-Order Approach

There have, of course, been a whole host of objections raised against higher-order theories of phenomenal consciousness over the years. (See, e.g., Aquila 1990; Jamieson and Bekoff 1992; Dretske 1993, 1995; Goldman 1993, 2000; Güzeldere 1995; Tye 1995; Chalmers 1996; Byrne 1997; Siewert 1998; Levine 2001; Rowlands 2001; Seager 2004; Block, 2011.) Many of these objections, although perhaps intended as objections to higher-order theories as such, are often framed in terms of one or another particular version of such a theory. A general moral to be taken away from the present discussion should then be this: the different versions of a higher-order theory of phenomenal consciousness need to be kept distinct from one another, and critics should take care to state which version of the approach is under attack, or to frame objections that turn merely on the higher-order character of all of these approaches. (Compare the care that one has to take if one wishes to mount an attack on utilitarian moral theory, given the multitude of different theories that actually fly under that banner.) I shall discuss a few ‘local’ objections first, before discussing some generic ones.

7.1 Local objections

A good many objections against specific versions of higher-order theory have already been discussed above. Thus in section 3 we discussed Dretske's (1995) ‘lack of any higher-order phenomenology’ objection to inner sense theory (which only targets inner sense theory). And in section 4 we discussed Dretske's (1993) ‘spot’ objection to actualist higher-order thought theory, as well as Goldman's (2000) epistemological objection, each of which appears to apply only to HOT theories. Of course some of the objections discussed above target more than one version of higher-order theory, while still not being fully general in scope. Thus the cognitive/computational complexity objections discussed in sections 3 and 4 apply to inner sense theories and to actualist HOT theories, but not to dispositionalist HOT or to some self-representational theories.

Another ‘local’ objection (which is actually a generalization of a variant of the misrepresentation problem discussed in connection with inner sense theory in section 3 above) is the targetless higher-order representation problem (Byrne 1997; Neander 1998; Levine 2001). This is confronted by both inner sense theory and actualist HOT theory (but not by either dispositionalist HOT or self-representational theories, according to which the relevant higher-order state can't exist in the absence of the targeted state). For in each case it seems that a higher-order experience of a perception of red, say, or a higher-order thought about a perception of red, might exist in the absence of any such perception occurring. So it would seem to the subject that she is experiencing red, or she might believe that she is experiencing red, in the absence of any such experience. (Note that the point isn't just that she might undergo such a seeming, or have such a belief, in the absence of anything really red. Rather, the point is that she might not really be undergoing any sort of visual experience as of red at all.) In which case, does the subject have a phenomenally conscious experience as of red, or not?

Both Lycan (1996) and Rosenthal (2005) are sanguine in the face of this objection. Each allows that targetless higher-order representations are a possibility (albeit rare, perhaps), and each opts to say that the subject in such a case is phenomenally conscious. But each denies that this is a problem for their account. Lycan, for example, insists that it is surely possible that it might seem to someone that she is feeling pain when really no relevant first-order representation of pain is present. (He suggests that the effects of morphine, which leaves patients saying that their pain feels just as it was, but that they no longer care, might constitute such a case.) And surely such a person would have a phenomenally conscious experience as of pain. Rosenthal, likewise, uses pain as an example. He points to cases of dental patients who initially experience pain in the dentist's chair despite the fact that the relevant nerves are completely destroyed. It seems that their fear, combined with the noise and vibration of the drill, causes them to mistakenly believe that they are feeling pain. (When the drilling is stopped, and their dead nerves are explained to them, they thereafter experience only the sound and the vibration.) So this would be a case in which a higher-order thought about experiencing pain is alone sufficient to induce a phenomenally conscious experience as of being in pain. A critic, however, might respond that the illusion is caused, instead, by a vivid imagining of pain, rather than by a higher-order thought about feeling pain. Alternatively, if a higher-order thought is causally involved it might be that a top-down expectation of pain causes a first-order experience of pain, as opposed to being constitutive of the feeling of pain. (Note that this seems perfectly possible, since it is the opposite of well-known placebo effects of expectation in reducing pain.)

Block (2011) has recently restated the targetless HOT objection to inner sense theory and actualist forms of HOT theory, with replies coming from Rosenthal (2011) and Weisberg (2011), both of whom opt to say that the mere seeming of being in pain (provided by the higher-order belief that one is in pain in the absence of first-order pain) is sufficient for phenomenally conscious pain. It is not clear that this addresses Block's point, which is that one would not expect the mere belief that one feels pain to matter to us in all the ways that pain matters. Block develops this point with respect to the awfulness of pain. It would be remarkable (indeed, mysterious) if a higher-order belief should have all of the causal powers of the mental state that the belief is about. And in particular, there is no reason to expect that a higher-order belief that one is in pain should possess the negative valence and high-arousal properties of pain itself. But the latter are surely crucial components of phenomenally conscious pain. If so, then a higher-order belief that one feels pain in the absence of first-order pain will not be sufficient for the conscious feeling of pain.

Although Block (2011) does not develop the argument in this way, he could equally have emphasized the analog, fine-grained, character of one's conscious experience. For a higher-order belief is presumably fully conceptual in content. The belief that one feels pain will embed the concept pain, but the concept won't itself possess the rich and fine-grained character of the state that it refers to. But in that case, a problem for Rosenthal's and Weisberg's response is that it seems unable to account for the fine-grained, apparently ineffable, character of our experience. For the subject will merely be entertaining a higher-order thought with the conceptual content I am experiencing pain, which lacks any such character.

Yet another ‘local’ objection is targeted against higher-order thought theories in particular (whether actualist or dispositionalist). It presents such theories with a dilemma: either they are attempts to explicate the concept of consciousness, in which case they are circular; or they are attempts to provide a reductive explanation of the property of being conscious, in which case they generate a vicious regress (Rowlands 2001). The first horn can be swiftly dismissed. For as Rosenthal (2005) and many others have made clear, higher-order theories aren't in the business of conceptual analysis. Rather, their goal is to provide a reductive explanation of what it is for a state to be phenomenally conscious. Our discussion will therefore focus upon the second horn.

Rowlands thinks that HOT theories face a vicious regress because they explain state-consciousness in terms of higher-order thought, and because (Rowlands claims) only conscious thoughts make us aware of the things that those thoughts concern. He gives the example of coming to believe that his dog is seriously ill. If he (Rowlands) thinks and behaves in ways that are best explained by attributing to him the belief that his dog is ill, but if that belief isn't entertained consciously, then surely this won't be a case in which he is aware that his dog is ill. Only when he consciously thinks something equivalent to ‘My dog is ill’ does he become aware of his dog's illness, surely. So if we are to become aware of our conscious states by entertaining higher-order thoughts about them, then these thoughts will have to be conscious ones, requiring us to be aware of them, in turn, via further higher-order thoughts that are also conscious; and so on, without end.

HOT theorists have numerous options available to them in responding to this argument. One is to challenge the intuition that only conscious thoughts make us aware of things. Thus it seems that Rowlands, when reflecting back on his dog-nurturing behavior of recent days, could surely conclude something along the lines of, ‘It seems that I have been aware of my dog's illness all along; that is why I have been behaving as I have.’ Another response would be to allow that there is a way of understanding the concept of awareness such that a person only counts as aware of something if the mental state in virtue of which they are aware of that thing is itself a conscious one, but to deny that this is the relevant sense of ‘awareness’ which is put to work in HOT theories. A third option would be to stress the distinction between phenomenal consciousness and state consciousness more generally, claiming that there need be no regress involved in explaining the former in terms of the latter, provided that some separate account can be provided for the latter. Finally, a dispositional HOT theorist can reply that what makes us aware of a conscious experience is the higher-order perceptual content that the state possesses, but possesses by virtue of its availability to higher-order thought together with the truth of some variety of consumer semantics. For Rowlands (2001) is explicit that the regress objection doesn't operate against higher-order perception accounts of consciousness. This is because he concedes that unconscious perceptions do serve to make us aware of the objects of those perceptions.

7.2 Generic objections

One generic objection, which can probably be recast in such a way as to apply to any higher-order theory (although it is most easily expressed against inner sense theory or actualist HOT theory), is the so-called ‘rock’ objection (Goldman 1993; Stubenberg 1998). We don't think that when we become aware of a rock (either perceiving it, or entertaining a thought about it) that the rock thereby becomes conscious. So why should our higher-order awareness of a mental state (either via a perception-like state, produced by inner sense, or via a higher-order thought about it) render that mental state conscious? Thinking about a rock doesn't make the rock ‘light up’ and become phenomenally conscious. So why should thinking about my perception of the rock make the latter phenomenally conscious, either?

An initial reply to this objection involves pointing out that my perception of the rock is a mental state, whereas the rock itself isn't (Lycan 1996). Since phenomenal consciousness is a property that (some) mental states possess, we can then say that the reason why the rock isn't rendered phenomenally conscious by my awareness of it is that it isn't the right sort of thing to be phenomenally conscious, whereas my perception of the rock is. This reply may be apt to strike the objector as trite. But perhaps more can be said from the perspective of inner sense theory, at least. Notice that my perception of the rock does, in a sense, confer on the latter a subjective aspect. For example, the rock is represented from one particular spatial perspective, and only some of its properties (e.g. color) and not others (e.g. mass) are represented. Likewise, then, with my perception of the rock. When it is higher-order perceived it, too, will acquire a subjective aspect, being presented to me in a distinctive sort of way. But as we saw at the outset of this essay, what phenomenal consciousness is is a mental state with distinctive subjective aspect or feel. Hence it is explicable why the perceptual targeting of a mental state, and only a mental state, should result in phenomenal consciousness.

Similar replies to the rock objection are given by Van Gulick (2001) and Gennaro (2005) from the perspective of self-representational theories. Both point out that a rock isn't the kind of thing that can be incorporated into a complex mental state that involves higher-order representations, in the sort of way required by a self-representational theory. In contrast, whether actualist HOT theory can reply adequately to the rock objection will depend on whether or not there is an adequate reply to the problem considered in section 4, which challenges the actualist HOT theorist to say why targeting a mental state with a HOT about that state should cause the latter to ‘light up’ and acquire a subjective dimension or feel.

Another generic objection is that higher-order theories, when combined with plausible empirical claims about the representational powers of non-human animals, will conflict with our common-sense intuition that such animals enjoy phenomenally conscious experience (Jamieson and Bekoff 1992; Dretske 1995; Tye 1995; Seager 2004). This objection can be pressed most forcefully against higher-order thought theories, of either variety, and against self-representational theories; but it is also faced by inner-sense theory (depending on what account can be offered of the evolutionary function of organs of inner sense). Since there is considerable dispute as to whether even chimpanzees have the kind of sophisticated ‘theory of mind’ to enable them to entertain thoughts about experiential states as such (Byrne and Whiten 1988, 1998; Povinelli 2000), it seems most implausible that many other species of mammal (let alone reptiles, birds, and fish) would qualify as phenomenally conscious, on these accounts. Yet the intuition that such creatures enjoy phenomenally conscious experiences is a powerful and deep-seated one, for many people. (Witness Nagel's classic 1974 paper, which argues that there must be something that it is like to be a bat.)

Many higher-order theorists have attempted to resist the claim that their theory has any such entailment, but with doubtful success (e.g. Gennaro 1996, 2004; Van Gulick 2006). In each case the strategy is to claim that the relevant higher-order representations are somehow simpler than those tested for by those who do comparative ‘theory of mind’ research, hence leaving it open that these simpler representations might be widespread in the animal kingdom. Gennaro (1996), for example, suggests that although animals might lack the concept experience, they can nevertheless be capable of higher-order indexical thoughts of the form ‘this is different from that’ (where ‘this’ and ‘that’ might refer to experiences of red and of green, respectively). The trouble here, however, is to explain what makes these indexicals higher-order in content without attributing concepts like experience of green to the animal. For on any consumer-semantic account of content, it is likely that the higher-order content of the indexical will be tied to the capacity to token some such concepts. Yet if one utilizes some form of informational semantics instead, the problem will be to explain what makes the indexical refer to the experience itself, rather than referring to what the experience itself is of (i.e. greenness). For the indexical will equally carry information about both.

Gennaro (2004) takes a somewhat different tack. While allowing that animals lack the concept experience of green, he thinks that they might nevertheless possess the (simpler) concept seeing green. But here he faces a dilemma. There is, indeed, a simpler concept of seeing, grounded in the capacity to track eye-direction and line of sight. But this isn't a higher-order concept. To say, in this sense, that someone sees green in just to say that there is some green in the line in which their eyes are pointed—no mental state needs to be attributed. In contrast, it appears that any concept of seeing that is genuinely higher-order will be one that it would be implausible to attribute to most species of animal (given the comparative evidence).

Van Gulick (2006), in contrast, suggests that all of the higher-order representing sufficient to render an experience phenomenally conscious can be left merely implicit in the way that the experience enters into relationships with other mental states and the control of behavior. So animals that lack the sorts of explicit higher-order concepts tested for in comparative ‘theory of mind’ research can nevertheless be phenomenally conscious. The difficulty here, however, is to flesh out the relevant notion of implicitness in such a way that not every mental state, possessed by every creature (no matter how simple), will count as phenomenally conscious. For since mental states can't occur singly, but are always part of a network of other related states, mental states will always carry information about others, thus implicitly representing them. It is implicit in the behavior of any creature that drinks, for example, that it is thirsty; so the drinking behavior implicitly represents the occurrence of the mental state of thirst. Likewise it is implicit in the state of any creature that is afraid that the creature is representing something in the environment as dangerous; so fear implicitly represents the occurrence of a representation of danger. And so on and so forth.

The basis for the common-sense intuition that animals possess phenomenally conscious states can be challenged, however. (How, after all, are we supposed to know whether it is like something to be a bat?) And that intuition can perhaps be explained away as a mere by-product of imaginative identification with the animal. (Since our images of their experiences are phenomenally conscious, we may naturally assume that the experiences imaged are similarly conscious. See Carruthers 1999, 2000.) But there is no doubt that one crux of resistance to higher-order theories will lie here, for many people. (For one set of attempts to defuse this resistance, arguing that a higher-order account need have few if any implications for our moral practices or for comparative psychology, see Carruthers 2005, chs.9–11.)

A third generic objection is that higher-order approaches cannot really explain the distinctive properties of phenomenal consciousness (Chalmers 1996; Siewert 1998; Levine 2006). Whereas the argument from animals is that higher-order representations aren't necessary for phenomenal consciousness, the argument here is that such representations aren't sufficient. It is claimed, for example, that we can easily conceive of creatures who enjoy the postulated kinds of higher-order representation, related in the right sort of way to their first-order perceptual states, but where those creatures are wholly lacking in phenomenal consciousness.

In response to this objection, higher-order theorists will join forces with first-order theorists and others in claiming that these objectors pitch the standards for explaining phenomenal consciousness too high (Block and Stalnaker 1999; Tye 1999; Carruthers 2000, 2005; Lycan 2001). They will insist that a reductive explanation of something—and of phenomenal consciousness in particular—doesn't have to be such that we cannot conceive of the explanandum (that which is being explained) in the absence of the explanans (that which does the explaining). (Indeed, we can also explain why no such explanation can be forthcoming, in terms of our possession of purely recognitional concepts of experience.) Rather, we just need to have good reason to think that the explained properties are constituted by the explaining ones, in such a way that nothing else needed to be added to the world once the explaining properties were present, in order for the world to contain the target phenomenon. But this is hotly contested territory. And it is on this ground that the battle for phenomenal consciousness may ultimately be won or lost.

Before we close, it is worth considering a variant of the third generic objection that we have just been discussing, which need involve no commitment to the latter's demanding standards of explanation. For it might be said that self-representing mental states (or indeed any of the theoretically-relevant kinds of pairing of first-order with higher-order representations) might occur within the unconscious mind, without (of course) thereby becoming conscious (Rey, 2008). Suppose that some version of Freudian theory is true, for example. Might there not be higher-order thoughts about the subject's experiences occurring within the unconscious mind, formed while the latter tries to figure out how to get its messages past the ‘censor’ and expressed in speech? So here again, just as with the third generic objection, the claim is that the occurrence of the sorts of representations postulated by higher-order theories isn't sufficient for phenomenal consciousness.

One sort of response to this objection would be to deny that such purely unconscious higher-order cognition ever actually occurs. Indeed, one might deny that it is even possible, given the constraints provided by the evolution of cognitively demanding mental functions (Carruthers 2000). But note that this reply will be unavailable to any higher-order theorist who has opted to downplay the cognitive demands of the capacity for higher-order representation in response to the problem of animal consciousness. For if higher-order representation is easily evolved, and is rife within the animal kingdom, then there doesn't appear to be any reason why it shouldn't evolve within unconscious sub-systems of the mind as well. And in any case it is doubtful whether the mere natural impossibility of higher-order representing within the unconscious mind would be enough to rebut the objection. Since higher-order theories claim that phenomenal consciousness is to be identified with, or is constituted by, the relevant sorts of higher-order representing, we would need to show that the imagined occurrence of the latter within the unconscious mind is metaphysically impossible, not just that it is naturally so.

Other responses to the objection remain (Carruthers 2000, 2005). One would be to allow that unconscious phenomenal consciousness is possible, and to appeal to the distinction between phenomenal consciousness and access consciousness to explain away the seeming contradiction involved. Remember, phenomenally conscious states are those that it is like something to be in, and that possess a subjective feel; whereas access-conscious states are those that are available to interact with some specified cognitive processes (for example, they might be those that are reportable in speech). So all we would be saying is that states with feel can occur in ways that aren't (for example) reportable by the subject. There is no contradiction here. An alternative possible response would be to extend the higher-order theory in question to include the relevant sort of access-consciousness as a further component. A dispositional HOT theorist, for example, might say that a phenomenally conscious state is one that both possesses the right sort of dual content and that is reportable by the subject. I shall not attempt to adjudicate between these possibilities here.

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