Simon of Faversham

First published Tue Nov 18, 2003; substantive revision Wed Jun 27, 2012

Simon of Faversham was a thirteenth-century commentator on Aristotle's logical and psychological works. He has been identified as a Thomist, but tends to follow Albert the Great in his views on the soul, and his later work moves toward the Augustinian views of Henry of Ghent on the question of the real distinction between essence and existence.

1. Biography

Simon of Faversham was born around 1260 in Faversham, a seaport town about ten miles west of Canterbury. He received his M.A. at Oxford, but very likely taught at Paris in the 1280's, returning to Oxford in 1289. This would explain the presence of his writings in continental manuscripts, as well as the references to him in some manuscripts as “Simon Anglicus,” a name that makes sense only outside England. Moreover, the colophon to his Questions on the Prior Analytics in Ms V speaks of him as “magistro Symone Anglico Parisius,” and his questions are similar in content and form to Parisian work, especially that of Peter of Auvergne, in the 1270's and early 1280's. Given the dependence of Simon's writing on his teaching, this indicates presence in the same teaching environment as Peter, Simon developing his classes from what he himself heard as a student and assisting his own Master. His return to Oxford in 1289 is supported by the fact that his work seems unaffected by later Parisian developments of Radulphus Brito's day, but more to the point, in 1290 he was ordained a deacon by Archbishop Peckham, and received the rectorship of Preston, a village near Faversham, a sinecure suitable for the support of a scholar. He never became a priest, and seems to have spent most of his scholarly life in the Arts faculty, a somewhat uncommon practice for his day, though it was done more frequently in the next century. Simon took the degree of Doctor of Theology, probably having long ago fulfilled the requirements for it, only when it became evident that he was a candidate for the chancellorship at Oxford, for which the degree was a prerequisite. He became chancellor in January 1304, but served only a short time, dying in 1306 while traveling to the papal curia to contest, with the support of the King, the loss of a rich benefice to a rival, papal candidate.

2. Works

Simon of Faversham's works can be listed as follows:

  • Questions on Porphyry. Edited by Pasquale Mazarella in his “Simon of Faversham” (1957).
  • Questions concerning Universals. It is not certain if this is Simon's, and Lohr 1973 rejects it. Grabmann 1933 lists the questions, and gives the work its title, but it seems likely that it is a continuation of Simon's questions on the Prior Analytics.
  • Questions on the Categories. Edited in Ottaviano 1930 from one manuscript, and by Mazarella in Simon of Faversham 1957 from the three chief manuscripts.
  • Questions on the De interpretatione. Edited by Mazarella in Simon of Faversham 1957.
  • On Sex principiorum. This may be by Simon, if Lewry 1979 is right. It seems strongly influenced by the commentary of Robert Kilwardby (Ms. Cambridge, Peterhouse 205). Lewry quotes several passages in his article.
  • Two sets of Questions on the Prior Analytics. Lohr 1973 regards the second set, usually called a commentary on the Posterior Analytics, as spurious. It is short and fragmentary. Ebbesen 2010 provides a list of the questions.
  • Two sets of Questions on the Posterior Analytics. Edited by Longeway, forthcoming.
  • Literal Commentary on the Posterior Analytics. Lohr 1973 and 1971 doubts that this and the other literal commentaries in the same manuscript (on the Topics and De anima) are genuine, but since Wolf 1966 has argued convincingly that the De anima commentary is genuine, it seems possible that this work is too. On the other hand, it is not attributed within the manuscript, and the other unattributed work in the manuscript, a commentary on De generatione et corruptione, belongs to Giles of Rome.
  • Two sets of Questions on the De sophisticis elenchis. Edited by Sten Ebbesen et al. in Simon of Faversham 1984.
  • Literal Commentary on the Topics. Attributed to a “magister Simonis.” Lohr doubts that it is Simon of Faversham's, and suggests it may be by Simon Dacus. But if the De anima commentary in the same manuscript is by Faversham, as Wolf argues, then this very likely is, too.
  • Questions on the Physics. A reportatio by Robert of Clothale, which it might be argued could not have been done before 1290. The questions are listed in Zimmermann 1971.
  • Literal Commentary on De anima. A literal commentary attributed in the manuscript to “Magister Simonis.” Lohr 1973 thinks it may be by Simon Dacus, but Wolf 1966 argues convincingly that it is Faversham's. Many passages from the commentary are cited at length in Wolf 1966.
  • Questions on De anima. S. Sharp 1934 has edited the third book from a single manuscript. Vennebusch 1963 has edited Question 4 from another manuscript, and Vennebusch 1965 lists all the questions. Wolf 1966 quotes the work extensively, and edits three questions.
  • Concerning De intellectu et intelligibili. Lohr 1973 does not list this work.
  • Questions on De somno.
  • Questions on De motu animalium.
  • Questions on De longitudine et brevitate vitae. Extracts in Ebbesen 1980a.
  • Questions on De juventute et senectute (i.e., the first two chapters of De vita).
  • Questions on De respiratione.
  • Sophisma: A Universal is an Intention. Edited in Yokoyama 1969 from one manuscript. Pinborg 1971 adds notes collating the other manuscripts with Yokoyama's edition.
  • Commentary on Priscian's De constructione (= Institutiones Grammaticae). Possibly by Simon, if Lewry 1979 is right. Like the commentary on Sex principiorum, this depends heavily on Robert Kilwardby (Ms Oxford, Corpus Christi College 119).
  • On the Tractatus of Peter of Spain. De Rijk 1968 gives a summary and extensive quotations. It is a literal commentary, and in the version we have it covers only tractates I-V. De Rijk dates it after 1269–72.
  • Excerpts on the Meteorologica. The manuscript describes this as a “compilation” by Simon. It is presumably a compilation of other people's work, but Simon is said in the manuscript to have provided notes of his own.
  • Contributions to theological debates at Oxford. Little and Pelster 1934 have transcribed these debates from a manuscript that names the contributors in the margins opposite their contributions. “Faversham” occurs next to two of the arguments. The manuscript was written 1298–1301.

3. Doctrine

Simon of Faversham's literary production, aside from the opusculum, Sophisma: A Universal is an Intention, consists entirely of commentaries on Aristotle's logical and psychological works, and is clearly a product of his teaching. For the most part he devotes his attention in these commentaries to the exposition of Aristotle, resolving interpretational problems with suitable distinctions. We have a couple of examples of second commentaries on the same material which reveal a mind quite capable of reconsidering its views. Only occasionally does he take on some prominent issue of his time, as one might out of boredom in teaching an elementary class on a classical figure, or out of the conviction that one has something to say here and no more suitable arena in which to say it.

Simon has often been identified as a follower of Thomas Aquinas (for instance, by Gilson and Mazarella), and he certainly knows Thomas, but it is probably wrong to identify him as a strict Thomist. In his commentaries on Aristotle's De anima, discussed by Wolf, Simon follows Thomas and Albert the Great closely in their attack on Averroism. But he differs from Thomas and sides with Albert in taking the soul to be in itself a complete substance, which comes to inform the body, but not itself a corporeal form, even in part. He also takes the powers of the soul to be its parts, whereas Thomas saw them as accidents of the whole man, or, in the case of the intellect, of the soul. Again unlike Thomas, Simon identifies the soul with the intellect, taking the intellect to subsist of itself, though it is also the form of a particular human being which itself subsists through it.

The acid test for a Thomist may be his adherence to the real distinction between essence and existence, and Simon does follow Aquinas on the real distinction in Question 20 of his Categories commentary, written early in his career. But in his second commentary on the Posterior Analytics, Question 49, written much later, he explicitly criticizes Thomas's views, and himself follows the views of Henry of Ghent, though he does not identify their author. With this change of heart he follows Henry in adopting the phrase esse in effectu for existence from Avicenna (On First Philosophy V 1).

Simon's objection to Thomas's view is this: if existence differs from essence in creatures, then it is something added, though Thomas, of course, insists that it is not an accident added to the essence, as Avicenna thought. (This common criticism of Avicenna is probably off base, but it was generally accepted as correct at the time, on the authority of Averroës.) But if existence is added to essence, then it is a kind of actuality. Now Thomas says it is primary actuality, but this cannot be, for essence is the primary actuality. The point here is that essence is not pure potentiality, for only prime matter fits that distinction. There is much that is true of the essence of a human being (for instance, that it is rational, not merely potentially rational), and so there is a kind of primary actuality here. But existence cannot be an added secondary actuality, either, as Thomas confesses. So existence is nothing real added at all to essence, which is the same as saying that it is not really different from essence. But it is different in some way from essence, and that means it differs in formula (ratio) from the essence.

What is the formula of existence? Well, one considers a substance as existing when one considers it insofar as it is part of the causal order, and itself caused by something to be part of that order. So existence is the sort of being possessed by something which is the effect of another thing. It is esse in effectu, a being in an effect. Finally, borrowing a notion from Giles of Rome, he argues that existence falls under the category of substance, for there are substantial relations; for instance, the relation between matter and form falls under substance. Esse in effectu, then, is the sort of being a particular substance has, as opposed to inesse, which is the sort of being an accident has. It should be noted that the denial of the real distinction between essence and existence here leaves a crucial ambiguity in place. Is Simon to be assimilated to Avicenna, taking an essence considered absolutely and in itself as an actual reality independently of the reality of particulars bearing that essence? Or is he closer to Averroës, regarding the particular individual as the underlying reality, which, viewed in abstraction from causal connections, is really identical with its own essence? It seems Simon tars Avicenna and Thomas Aquinas with the same brush, arguing that both of them take existence to be some added reality, but taking that point, does Simon think that the essence as such or the particular falling under it which we encounter is the subject of these various formulae, esse essentiae and esse existentiae, under which we view it?

The answer is almost surely that he would reject our demand that he make a choice. Really the essence and the particular are the same thing; they differ only in formula. To say this surely requires one to reject the demand that he decide which formula is the one that gets things the way they really are. This is a crucial point for Simon's epistemology, for it is this real identity of essence and particular which allows us to gain scientific knowledge of particulars, since the essence can be equated with a thing's form, and the form comes to be in the soul and an object of its immediate awareness when the soul knows a thing. Simon accounts for second intentions as conceptions, not of first intentions or concepts, but of extramental things. One forms the notion of species, for instance, by noting that the nature of horse (not the conept of horse) belongs to several numerically distinct things. Indeed, he so identifies the nature of a thing and the concept formed of it that he speaks of the nature as “predicated of” the thing. (Pini 2002) Simon came back to England as a Modist, subscribing to modi significandi that are parallel to modi essendi in the real world, so that the structure of language and thought mirrors the structure of reality. He also shared the Parisian bent toward an intentionalist logic, only occasionally availing himself of the older, and, by this time, more English, tradition of extensionalist logic found in discussions of properties of terms in figures such as William of Sherwood, and soon to be revived in Ockhamist terminism. (Ebbesen 1985)

The term ‘esse in effectu’ is coordinate with two other terms, ‘esse essentiae,’ and ‘esse universale.’ These three are discussed in Simon's Sophisma, in which he holds that one can speak of the essence as it is part of the natural world and a particular to be found interacting with other particulars in the natural world, or without reference to anything outside itself, or as it is conceived in the intellect, so that it can be asserted of different things. The picture comes from Avicenna, and plays a role in Thomas's thought as well. Like Thomas, Simon insists that the universal concept has a foundation in the essence itself, which is real quite independently of the concept in virtue of being what it is, though it is, in itself, neither universal nor particular, both because it is not in itself brought under the consideration of the intellect, and because it is not in itself multiplied, or for that matter, singular, in the way that individuals entering into natural causal processes are. But the Sophisma never uses the term ‘esse in effectu,’ preferring to speak of being in matter or in particulars, or outside the soul, when it wants to indicate existing particulars. Moreover, it does not discuss the real distinction either, restricting itself to a consideration of universality. Like the Categories commentary, it seems to predate the reconsiderations that produced the criticism of Thomas in Simon's Questions on the Posterior Analytics.

Simon follows Giles of Rome on many matters in his commentary on the Sophistici Elenchi, and also shows familiarity with Giles's Posterior Analytics commentary, following Giles on the nature of logic, though he prefers Aquinas in his most characteristic doctrines, arguing that the real definition of the subject term is the middle term in the highest sort of demonstration (demonstratio potissima) and identifying the fourth mode of per se predication (predicating a thing of its cause) as operative in demonstration along with the first two modes (predicating of the subject something contained in its definition, and predicating of the subject something containing it in its definition). Indeed, he follows Aquinas on these matters even in the second Posterior Analytics commentary, in which he differs with Aquinas's view on the real distinction.

In his treatment of the Categories Simon was likely influenced, again, by Henry of Ghent. He derives substance, quantity, and quality from distinct sorts of extramental things, and the other seven categories from distinct modes of being (corresponding to Henry's ratio), assuming a parallel between modes of being and modes of predicating. Thus relation does not add a distinct thing to its foundation in reality, even though it is a distinct category. (Questions on the Physics III, question 10, Questions on the Categories, question 42; see Pini 2002 and 2005)

Simon treats Liar paradoxes in the Questions on the Sophistical Refutations as instances of the fallacy secundum quid. The sentence that states that it itself is false is false simpliciter, since it signifies other than things are, but true secundum quid, since whoever says that he says what he says speaks truly, and the sentence says it is false, as it is, simpliciter (Novaes 2008).

His forays into more serious philosophical issues are limited by Simon's general simplicity of approach, no doubt dictated by his undergraduate students, and the obvious need to move on quickly to other things. The chief value of Simon's work is the window it provides into the world of a pedestrian but intelligent and honest scholar, typical of his time and place.

Bibliography

Primary Literature: Simon's Works

  • De Rijk, L.M., 1968. “On the Genuine Text of Peter of Spain's Summule Logicales. II: Simon of Faversham (d. 1306) as a Commentator of the Tracts I-V of the Summule,” Vivarium, 6: 69–101.
  • Ebbesen, Sten, 1980a. “Gerontobiologiens Grundproblemer,” Museum Tusculanum, 40–43: 269–88. (Contains extracts from Simon's quaestiones on De longitudine et brevitate vitae.)
  • –––, 2010. “The Prior Analytics in the Latin West: 12th-13th Centuries,” Vivarium, 48 (1/2): 96–133. (Pp. 115–119 contains a list of the questions in Simon's commentary.)
  • Longeway, John L., 1977. “Simon of Faversham's Questions on the Posterior Analytics: a Thirteenth-Century View of Science,” Ph.D. thesis, Cornell University. [Dissertation Abstracts International, 38(7): 4211-A.]
  • Ottaviano, Carmelo, 1930. “Le Quaestiones super libro Praedicamentorum di Simone di Faversham,” Atti della Reale Accademia Nazionale die Lincei, serie 6, Memorie della Classe di Scienze Morali, Storiche e Filologiche, 3: 257–351.
  • Pinborg, Jan, 1971. “Simon of Faversham's Sophisma: Universale est Intentio: A Supplementary Note,” Medieval Studies, 33: 360–65.
  • Sharp, D., 1934. “Simonis de Faverisham Quaestiones super tertium De anima,” Archives d'histoire doctrinale et littéraire du moyen âge, 9: 307–368. (Contains an edition of Book III from one manuscript.)
  • Simon of Faversham, 1957. Magistri Simonis Anglici sive de Faverisham Opera Omnia. Vol. 1: Opera logica, tomus Prior. (1) Quaestiones super libro Porphyrii. (2) Quaestiones super libro Praedicamentorum. (3) Quaestiones super libro Perihermeneias. Edited by Pasquale Mazzarella. Pubblicazioni dell'Instituto universitario di magistero di Catania, serie filosofica, testi critici, 1. Padua: Cedam.
  • –––, 1984. Quaestiones super libro Elenchorum. Edited by Sten Ebbesen, Thomas Izbicki, John Longeway, Francesco del Punta, Eileen Serene, and Eleonore Stump. Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies.
  • Vennebusch, Joachim, 1963. Ein anonymer Aristoteleskommentar des xiii. Jahrhunderts: Quaestiones in tres libros de Anima (Admont: Stiftsbibliothek, cod. lat. 367). Paderborn: F. Schöningh. (See pp. 25–27. Edits one question from Simon's commentary.)
  • Vennebusch, Joachim, 1965. “Die Quaestiones in tres libros De anima des Simon von Faversham,” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie, 47: 20–39. (Lists the questions in Simon's commentary.)
  • Wolf, Friedrich Antonius, 1966. Die Intellektslehre des Simon von Faversham nach seinem De-anima-Kommentaren. Inaugural-Dissertation. Bonn: Universität. (Contains many excerpts from both the literal and the question commentaries on De anima, and an appendix editing three questions from the latter.)
  • Yokoyama, Tetsuo, 1969. “Simon of Faversham's Sophisma: Universale est intentio,” Medieval Studies, 31: 1–14. (An edition of the work.)
  • Zimmermann, Albert, 1971. Verzeichnis Ungedruckter Kommentare zur Metaphysik und Physik des Aristoteles aus der Zeit von etwa 1250–1350. Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters, 8/9. Leiden/Cologne: E.J. Brill. (See pp. 10, 32–33, 190–96.)

Secondary Literature

  • Callus, D.A., 1943. “Introduction of Aristotelian Learning to Oxford,” Proceedings of the British Academy, 29: 229–81. (See pp. 275–79.)
  • Clerke, Agnes Mary, 1897. “Simon of Faversham,” Dictionary of National Biography, vol. 52 (vol. 18 in reissue of 1921): 263.
  • Coxe, Henry Octavius, 1852. Catalogus codicum Mss. qui in collegiis aulisque Oxoniensibus hodie adservantur, Oxford. (See vol. 1: 115–16.)
  • Gilson, Etienne, 1955. A History of Christian Philosophy in the Middle Ages, New York: Random House. (See p. 361 and p. 707 note 83.)
  • Glorieux, Palémon, 1923–1950, “Simon de Faversham,” Dictionnaire de théologie catholique, 14: 2119–20.
  • –––, 1971. La faculté des arts et ses maîtres au xiiie sièle, Paris: J. Vrin. (See notice 431, pp. 356–58.)
  • Grabmann, Martin, 1933. Die Aristoteleskommentare des Simon von Faversham: Handschriftliche Mitteilungen, Sitzungsberichte der Bayerischen Akademie des Wissenschaft, Philosophisch-historische Abteilung, Jahrgang 1933, Heft 3, Munich: Verlag der Bayerischen Akademie der Wissenschaften.
  • Hackman, A., 1860. Catalogi codicum manuscriptorum Bibliothecae Bodleianae, pars quarta: codices … T. Tanneri … complectens. Oxford; 2nd impression, 1966. (See cols. 493–94.)
  • Lewry, Osmund, 1979. “The Commentaries of Simon of Faversham and ms. Merton College 288,” Bulletin de philosophie médiévale, 21: 73–80.
  • Little, A.G., and Franz Pelster, 1934. Oxford Theology and Theologians ca. A.D. 1289–1302, Oxford: Clarendon Press. (See pp. 262–65, 336, 350, and the index on p. 370 s.v. Faversham.)
  • Lohr, C.H., 1971. “Problems of Authorship concerning some Medieval Aristotle Commentaries,” Bulletin de philosophie médiévale, 13: 131–36. (See 135–36 on Simon's putative literal commentaries.)
  • Lohr, C.H., 1973. “Medieval Latin Aristotle Commentaries,” Traditio, 29: 93–197. (See pp. 141–46 for a listing of commentaries attributed to Simon.)
  • Mazarella, Pasquale, 1957. “Simone di Faversham,” Enciclopedia Filosofica, 4: 632–33; 1968 ed., 5: 1383.
  • Novaes, Catarina Dutilh, and Stephen Read, 2008. “Insolubilia and the Fallacy Secundum quid et Simpliciter,” Vivarium, 46 (2): 175–191.
  • Novaes, Catarina Dutilh, 2008. “A Comparative Taxonomy of Medieval and Modern Approaches to Liar Sentences,” History and Philosophy of Logic, 29 (3): 277–261. (For Faversham, p. 237, classifying him as one of the restringentes, who hold that a part cannot signify or supposit for the whole.)
  • Ottaviano, Carmelo, 1931. “Le opere di Simone di Faversham e la sua posizione nel problem degli universali,” Archivio di Filosofia, 1: 15–29.
  • Pattin, A., 1955. De verhouding tussen zijn en wezenheid en de transcendentale relatie in de 2e helft der xiiie eeuw. Verhandelingen van de Koninklijke Vlaamse Academie voor Wetenschappen, Letteren en Schone Kunsten van België; Klasse der Letteren, Verhandeling nr. 21. Brussels: Paleis der Academiën. (See pp. 243–46, 261.)
  • Pickavé, Martin, 2008. “Simon of Faversham on Aristotle's Categories and the scientia praedicamentorum,” in Medieval Commentaries on Aristotle's Categories, ed. L.A. Newton, Leiden and Boston: Brill, 183–220.
  • Pinborg, Jan, 1975. “Die Logik der Modistae,” Studia Medieweistyczne, 16: 39–97. (See p. 42, p. 48 n. 52, and pp. 67–69.)
  • Pini, Giorgio, 2002. Categories and Logic in Duns Scotus: An Interpretation of Aristotle's Categories in the Late Thirteenth Century. Boston: Brill. (Chapter 3: Second intentions in Hentry of Ghent, Simon and Faversham, and Radulphus Brito, 68–98.)
  • –––, 2005. “Scotus's Realist Conception of the Categories: His Legacy to Late Medieval Debates,” Vivarium, 43 (1): 63–110. (See p. 73)
  • Powicke, Frederick Maurice, 1925. “Master Simon of Faversham,” in Mélanges d'histoire du moyen âge offerts à M. Ferdinand Lot par ses amis et ses élèves, pp. 649–58. Paris: Champion.
  • Powicke, Frederick Maurice, 1931. The Medieval Books of Merton College, Oxford: University Press. (See pp. 27, 154–56.)
  • Russell, Josiah Cox, 1936. Dictionary of Writers of Thirteenth Century England, Bulletin of the Institute of Historical Research (Special Supplement 3), London: Longmans, Green and Co.; reprinted With Additions and Corrections, London: Dawson & Sons, 1967. (See pp. 148–49 and the Additions in the 1967 edition.)
  • Serene, Eileen, 1981. “Demonstrative Science,” in The Cambridge History of Later Medieval Philosophy, ed. N. Kretzmann, et al., Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. pp. 496–517. (See p. 507.)
  • Stump, Eleonore, 1981. “Topics: Their Development and Absorption into Consequences,” in The Cambridge History of Later Medieval Philosophy, ed. N. Kretzmann, et al., pp. 273–99. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. (See pp. 289–90, 292).
  • Tanner, Thomas, 1748. Bibliotheca Britannico Hibernica…, London; reprinted, Tucson: Audax Press, 1963. (See p. 673.)
  • Tiné, Antonino, 1990. “Simone di Faversham e le scienze,” in Knowledge and the Sciences in Medieval Philosophy. Proceedings of the Eighth International Congress of Medieval Philosophy (SIEPM), edited by Monika Asztalos, John E. Murdoch, and Ilkka Niiniluoto, Acta Philosophica Fennica, 48 (2): 638–44.
  • –––, 1996. “Simon of Faversham: Proemi alla logica,” in Aristotle in Britain during the Middle Ages. Proceedings of the SIEPM, April 1994, edited by John Marenbon, Turnhout, Brepols. 211–31.

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