Proof of the Lemma for Hume's Principle

[Note: We use εF to denote the extension of the concept F.]

Let P,Q be arbitrarily chosen concepts. We want to show:

εQ ∈ #P ≡ Q ≈ P

So, by definition of #F, we have to show:

εQ ∈  εP^≈ ≡ Q ≈ P

We prove this by appealing to the Law of Extensions, which yields the following Fact:

Fact: εQ ∈  εP^≈ ≡ P^≈(εQ)

(→) Assume εQ ∈  εP^≈ (to show: Q ≈ P). Then, by the above Fact, we know P^≈(εQ), i.e.,

[λx ∃H(x = εH & H ≈ P)](εQ)

By λ-conversion, this implies:

∃H(εQ = εH & H ≈ P)

Let R be such a concept:

εQ = εR & R≈ P

(1)

But, by Basic Law V, the first conjunct implies ∀x(Qx ≡ Rx). Since the material equivalence of two concepts implies their equinumerosity (this was noted as Fact 1 in the subsection on Equinumerosity in the main part of the entry), it follows that Q ≈ R. So from this result and the second conjunct of (1), it follows that Q ≈ P, by the transitivity of equinumerosity (Fact 4 in the subsection on Equinumerosity).

(←) Assume Q ≈ P (to show: εQ ∈  εP^≈). Then, by identity introduction, we know: εQ = εQ & Q ≈ P. So, by existential generalization:

∃H(εQ = εH & H ≈ P)

And by λ-Conversion:

[λx ∃H(x = εH & H ≈ P)](εQ)

So, by the Law of Extensions, εQ ∈  εP^≈.