Supplement to School of Names
Pronunciation Guide
The following is a very rough guide to the pronunciation of some of the Chinese terms used in the article. A question mark indicates a rising tone, an exclamation point a falling tone. (Caution: Some of the suggested English equivalents approximate the Chinese sounds only vaguely.)
| Chinese Term | Approximate English Pronunciation |
| Bian (disputation, dialectics) | “be-yen!” pronounced as a single syllable |
| Bian zhe (disputers, dialecticians) | “be-yen!” as a single syllable, followed by “juh” (rhymes with “uh-huh?”) |
| Deng Xi (famous lawyer) | “dung!” followed by “shee” as in ‘banshee’ |
| Fei (not-this, wrong) | “fey” |
| Gongsun Long (proponent of white horse sophism) | “gohng” (“go” plus an “-ng” ending), followed by “soo-en” pronounced as one syllable, with the vowel shorter than the English ‘soon’; “lohng?” (“low” plus an “-ng” ending) |
| Hui Shi (proponent of paradoxes) | “hway!”, “shr” or “sher” |
| Jian bai (hard and white) | “jee-yen,” pronounced as a single syllable; “bye?” |
| Jixia (scholarly “thinktank” sponsored by King Xuan of Qi) | Two syllables: “jee!” followed by “shee-ya!” |
| Ke (admissible) | “ker” without the final ‘r’ |
| Mozi (classical text) | “mwo!” followed by “dz” |
| Qi (ancient state in northeast China) | “chee?”, pronouncing the “ch” roughly as in “watching” |
| Qin (ancient state in western China; eventually conquered all other states to form a unified empire in 221 B.C.) | “chin?”, pronouncing the “ch” roughly as in “watching” |
| Shi (this, right) | “shr!” or “sher!” as in “Sherlock” |
| Shi (stuff) | “shr?” or “sher?” as in “Sherlock” |
| Shuo (explanation) | “shwo” |
| Tong (same, similar) | “tohng?” (“toe” plus an “-ng?” ending) |
| Wu hou (the dimensionless) | “woo?” “hoe!” |
| Xing (shape) | “sheeng?” “shee” as in ‘banshee’ plus an “-ng?” ending |
| Xunzi (Confucian thinker and eponymous text) | “issue,” without the initial ‘i’ and adding a final ‘n’, followed by “dz” |
| Yi (thought, intention) | “e!” (a clipped pronunciation of the letter “e”) |
| Zhao (ancient state in north China) | “jow!”, rhyming with “ow!” |
| Zheng ming (correcting or rectifying names) | “jung!” as in ‘jungle’, followed by “ming?” as in ‘mingle’ |
| Zhi (pointing or referring) | “jr” (similar to the first syllable of ‘gerbil’) |
| Zhuangzi (classical Daoist text) | “joo-wong” pronounced as one syllable, followed by “dz” |