Notes to Belief Merging and Judgment Aggregation

1. The set At of atomic propositions is assumed to be ordered, i.e., an order such that p comes before q and q comes before r. Thus \((1,0,0)\) represents an interpretation that assigns true to p and false to q and r.

2. Technically, d is a pseudo-distance as the triangular inequality \((\forall \omega, \omega', \omega'' \in W\), \(d(\omega, \omega') \le d(\omega, \omega'') + d(\omega'', \omega'))\) is not required to hold. Konieczny and Pino Pérez (2002) showed that, if d satisfies the triangular inequality, then \(D_{\Sigma}\) satisfies the iteration axiom:

(\(\IC_{\textit{It}}\))
If \(\varphi \vdash \IC\) then \(\exists n \Delta_{\IC}^{n} (E,\varphi) \vdash\varphi\)

3. Similarly as the minimax rules in decision theory, the max operators aims at selecting the outcome that minimizes the worst disagreement. Such operators do not satisfy all the postulates for merging, and hence are called quasi-merging operators (Konieczny and Pino Pérez 2002).

4. Belief revision and belief merging have deep connections. In particular, merging operators can be seen as a generalization of revision operators (Konieczny and Pino Pérez 2002). More precisely, if \(\Delta\) is an IC merging operator, then the operator \(*\) defined as \(\varphi * \IC= \Delta_{\IC}(\varphi)\) is an AGM revision operator (Alchourrón et al. 1985). The other direction (whether an AGM revision operator defines an IC merging operator) has a more complex answer, which can be summarized by saying that a revision operator can define a merging IC operator if and only if the revision operator is defined in terms of distances.

5. The majority preservation property ensures that, if the proposition-wise majority vote is a consistent judgment set, the judgment aggreegation procedures must select that same judgment set (Lang et al. 2017).

Copyright © 2021 by
Gabriella Pigozzi <gabriella.pigozzi@lamsade.dauphine.fr>

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