Proof of Proposition 2.17

Proposition 2.17 (Aumann 1976)
Let M be the meet of the agents’ partitions H_i for each i ∈ N. A proposition E ⊆ Ω is common knowledge for the agents of N at ω iff M(ω) ⊆ E. In Aumann (1976), E is defined to be common knowledge at ω iff M(ω) ⊆ E.

Proof.
(⇐) By Lemma 2.16, M( ω ) is common knowledge at ω, so E is common knowledge at ω by Proposition 2.4.

(⇒) We must show that K*_N(E) implies that M(ω) ⊆ E. Suppose that there exists ω′ ∈ M(ω) such that ω′ ∉ E. Since ω′ ∈ M(ω), ω′ is reachable from ω, so there exists a sequence 0, 1, … , m−1 with associated states ω₁, ω₂, … , ω_m and information sets H_ik(ω_k) such that ω₀ = ω, ω_m = ω′, and ω_k ∈ H_ik(ω_k+1). But at information set H_ik(ω_m), agent i_k does not know event E. Working backwards on k, we see that event E cannot be common knowledge, that is, agent i₁ cannot rule out the possibility that agent i₂ thinks that … that agent i_m−1 thinks that agent i_m does not know E. □

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