Supplement to Common Knowledge
Proof of Proposition 2.5
Proposition 2.5.ω ∈ KmN(A) iff
(1) For all agents i1, i2, … , im ∈ N, ω ∈ Ki1Ki2 … Kim(A)
Hence, ω ∈ K*N(A) iff (1) is the case for each m ≥ 1.
Proof.
Note first that
| (2) |
∩ i1∈N |
Ki1 ( |
∩ i2∈N |
Ki2 ( … ( |
∩ im−1∈N |
Kim−1 ( |
∩ im∈N |
Kim(A) ) ) ) ) |
| = |
∩ i1∈N |
Ki1 ( |
∩ i2∈N |
Ki2 ( … ( |
∩ im−1∈N |
Kim−1(K1N(A))) ) ) |
| = |
∩ i1∈N |
Ki1 ( |
∩ i2∈N |
Ki2 … ( |
∩ im−2∈N |
Kim−2(K2N(A)) ) ) |
| = … |
| = |
∩ i1∈N |
Ki1(Km−1N(A)) |
| = | KmN(A) |
By (2),
KmN(A) ⊆ Ki1Ki2 … Kim(A)
for i1, i2, …, im ∈ N, so if ω ∈ KmN(A) then condition (1) is satisfied. Condition (1) is equivalent to
| ω ∈ |
∩ i1∈N |
Ki1 ( |
∩ i2∈N |
Ki2 ( … ( |
∩ im−1∈N |
Kim−1 ( |
∩ im∈N |
Kim(A) ) ) ) ) |
so by (2), if (1) is satisfied then ω ∈ KmN(A). □