Proof of Proposition 3.12

Proposition 3.12 (Bicchieri 1993)
In an extensive form game of perfect information, the agents follow the backwards induction solution if the following conditions are satisfied for each agent i at each information set I^ik:

1. i is rational, i knows this and i knows the game, and
2. At any information set I^jk+1 that immediately follows I^ik, i knows at I^ik what j knows at I^jk+1.

Proof.
The proof is by induction on m, the number of potential moves in the game. If m = 1, then at Iⁱ¹, by (a) agent i chooses a strategy which yields i her maximum payoff, and this is the backwards induction solution for a game with one move.

Now suppose the proposition holds for games having at most m = r potential moves. Let Γ be a game of perfect information with r + 1 potential moves, and suppose that ( α ) and ( β ) are satisfied at every node of Γ. Let Iⁱ¹ be the information set corresponding to the root of the tree for Γ. At Iⁱ¹, i knows that (a) and (b) obtain for each of the subgames that start at the information sets which immediately follow Iⁱ¹. Then i knows that the outcome of play for each of these subgames is the backwards induction solution for that subgame. Hence, at Iⁱ¹ i’s payoff maximizing strategy is a branch of the tree starting from Iⁱ¹ which leads to a subgame whose backwards induction solution is best for i, and since i is rational, i chooses such a branch at Iⁱ¹. But this is the backwards induction solution for the entire game Γ, so the proposition is proved for m = r + 1.

Return to Common Knowledge