Supplement to Evolutionary Thought Before Darwin

Long descriptions for some figures in Evolutionary Thought Before Darwin

Figure 1 description

Lamarck’s diagram is titled “TABLEAU: Servant à montrer l’origine des différens animaux” and then a vertical binary tree diagram with the nodes connected by dotted lines:

  • “Vers.” (root node, to the right and not connected by lines to the tree is “Infusoires. Polypes. Radiaires.”)
    • “Annelides. Cirrhipèdes. Mollusques.”
      • “Poissons. Reptiles.”
        • “Oiseaux.”
          • “Monotrèmes.”
        • “M. Amphibies.”
          • no text node
            • “M. Onguiculés.”
            • “M. Ongulés.”
          • “M. Cétacéa.”

Figure 2 description

Handwritten Richard Owen diagram from Joseph Henry Green lectures of March, 1827, which is titled “Ascending Scale”. On the left hand side the numbers 18 to 1 are written vertically to indicate rows. Reading from the bottom, row 1, somewhat of a tree diagram:

  • “Infusoria” (row 1)
    • “Entozoa Parenchymatosa” (row 3),
      “Entoza Nematoidea” (row 5)
      • “Vermes” (row 9)
      • “Insecta” (row 7)
        • “Arachnida” (row 8)
        • “Crustacea” (row 10),
          “Cirrhipedia” (row 12)
    • “Polypi” (row 2)
      • “Acalopha” (row 3),
        “Echinodermata” (row 6)
      • “Acephala nuda” (row 11)

Between rows 12 and 13 the two lines of the tree diagram ending with “Cirripedia” and “Acephala nuda” are connected with a horizontal line and followed with the continuation of the tree:

  • “Acephala testacea” (row 13),
    “Gasteropoda” (row 14),
    “Cephalopoda” (row 15),
    “Vertebrata” (between rows 15 and 16)
    • “Chondropterygii” (row 16),
      “Batrachia” (row 17),
      “Chelonia”, (row 18).
    • “Osseous Fishes” (row 16),
      “Ophidia” (row 17),
      “Sauria” (row 18),

Figure 3 description

Owen’s handwritten tree diagram of February, 1837,which is read bottom to top. (Some bits are crossed out which this description will skip.)

  • “Radiata” (root node)
    • “Monad”
      vertical line to
      “Rotifer”
      horizontal line to “Lepas” (this and the following in this branch are labeled “Articulata”)
      • node with no text
      • “Apis”
    • “Vibrio”
      vertical line with “Eutozoa” (this is parallel to the line)
      to “Holothuria”
    • “Hydra”
      vertical line to “Vesicularia”
      horizontal line to “Diazona” (this and following are labeled “Mollusca”)
      • “Sepia”
      • “Myxine” (this and the following are labeled “Vertebrata”
        • “Squalus”
        • “Sirena”
          vertical line to “Crocodilus”
          “Aves” (this and the next are underscored)
          “Mammalia”

Figure 4 description

Titled “Fig. 1. Archetypus.” in the original from Owen, 1849. This displays the Ideal vertebrate form, composed of serially-arranged Ideal vertebrae, from which all limbs and structures of the vertebrate skeleton can be conceived as formed by modification. This grounds the meaning of “identity” across vertebrate forms and is the basis for Owen’s distinction of “homology” from “analogy” in the vertebrate structure.

Copyright © 2023 by
Phillip Sloan <sloan.1@nd.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free