Notes to Theoretical Terms in Science

1. To mention only two of these intermediate positions: van Fraassen (1980) accepts a realist semantics for scientific statements but contests that science is aiming at true theories. Dummett’s antirealism suggests replacing the notion of truth by provability or warranted assertibility (Dummett 1978; Wright 1993). This alternative to realist semantics has never been worked out for scientific theories in greater detail, however.

2. An important difference between Przelecki (1969: ch. 6) and Andreas (2010) is that only the former requires those sentences that indirectly interpret a symbol to be analytic. This requirement is not in line with Carnap’s (1958) view that the analytic-synthetic distinction is not applicable to the single axioms of a scientific theory. Przelecki’s (1969) account, however, is more general than that of Andreas (2010) in that it does not assume a complete interpretation of the basic language \(L(V_o)\). The merits of both accounts can easily be combined.

Copyright © 2021 by
Holger Andreas <holger.andreas@ubc.ca>

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