Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Open Letter to Librarians

Dear Librarian,

In this letter, we'd like to lay out for you the various elements of our funding plan, indicate the endorsements it has received, and offer some reasons why we think you should lend your support to the SEP.

We have also prepared a special document focusing on the question, “Why should libraries at small colleges or public universities support the SEP?”

Our Funding Plan

The following institutions, Stanford University, the International Coalition of Library Consortia (ICOLC), the Scholarly Publishing and Academic Resources Coalition (SPARC), the Southeastern Library Network, Inc. (SOLINET), and the National Endowment for the Humanities (NEH), have partnered to implement a new model for ensuring long-term open access to the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (SEP). This model was developed by a committee of representatives from Stanford, ICOLC, SPARC, and SOLINET. The main elements of the model are:

The following table indicates the recommended contribution level for institutions in the U.S. and Canada which offer degrees in Philosophy:

Three Annual Payments of
Philosophy Ph.D. granting institutions $5000
Philosophy M.A. granting institutions $2000
Philosophy B.A. granting institutions $1000

For institutions outside the U.S. and Canada, the ICOLC plan calls for contributions that are appropriately calibrated to local economic conditions. You can find the contribution schedule for institutions outside the U.S and Canada here (in PDF).

Those who are curious about why we are not following a more traditional funding model are welcome to read our analysis of the problems we would face.

Endorsements

The NEH has now endorsed this plan by offering SOLINET a Challenge Grant. The NEH will give up to $500,000 (contributing $1 dollar for every $3 raised by the libraries). See the

Letter from Bruce Cole, Director, National Endowment for the Humanities

which explains how the SEP's funding model went through a rigorous referee process at the NEH. So if the libraries raise even $1.5 million towards their $3 million goal, the NEH contribution will put them at $2 million.

Tom Sanville, the Executive Director of OhioLINK and the meetings organizer of the ICOLC wrote:

A Call for ICOLC Initiated Global Community Action (283K PDF document)

which outlines many reasons for library participation in our funding plan and includes a spreadsheet that outlines how we hope to be self-sufficient after 3 years of fund-raising.

In addition, the SEP has become a SPARC Publishing Partner.

Finally, many institutions have endorsed our plan directly by their participation. The following institutions have already registered their commitment:

List of Libraries and Other Institutions Which Have Registered Their Support

Since the reasons for library participation in our fund-raising plan are scattered throughout the documents linked in above, we have extracted them and put them into the next section.

Reasons for Library Participation

  1. The SEP has become a "must-have" resource, given how widely its entries are read by students and faculty, and how widely its entries are used in course syllabi at major academic institutions. Even for libraries at smaller academic institutions and public libraries, it is the kind of publication that you would like to have but wouldn't be able to afford if it goes behind a subscription wall.
    • In a recent study, 75% of the first 100 entries published by the SEP were returned as the first match on a Google search, when you search on the titles or topics of those entries.
    • Our April 2002 survey discovered that 50% of our readers are students; this becomes significant when you realize that the SEP is now accessed over 400,000 times a week.
    • A search for "syllabus "Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy"" on Google yields a list of over 700 web pages and most of these are either actual course syllabi or pages of resources for course syllabi. Also, the Syllabus Finder appears to return over 800 syllabi making use of the SEP. Courses from disciplines including Computer Science, English, History, Logic, Mathematics, Philosophy, Political Science, and Psychology are represented.
  2. The SEP has developed a "one-time cost" plan (spread over 3 years), rather than an ongoing payment model. This saves the library money. The suggested contribution for your library depends on which degree in philosophy that it offers and where it is located in the world. The details are spelled out in the ICOLC Call to Action. However, even libraries at institutions without philosophy departments should consider contributing, since you will have constituents who are using the SEP (see item 4 below).
  3. The money that libraries contribute to the SEP will be protected. In particular, should the SEP project ever terminate, the money libraries contribute will be returned together with any unspent interest and appreciation. The contracts which implement this arrangement have been vetted by the NEH, SOLINET, and the Stanford Director of Planned Giving and Development Legal Counsel, and they have been approved by the Stanford Provost. We hope you agree that commercial and academic publishers never offer a return on money used to obtain access to a publication.
  4. There are students and scholars in other departments at your institution who are using the SEP, and so this is not just a resource for philosophers. Type your institution's domain name into our access statistics query page to discover usage at your institution. We hope you will agree that funds for the SEP therefore need not come only from the funds reserved for your philosophy collection purchases.
  5. For libraries that contribute to our funding plan, we will facilitate a simple download of our quarterly archives. (We make quarterly archives so as to have a stable method of citing the content of entries. The dynamic portion of the SEP is always changing, and we don't want users to cite the active versions of the entries. So the quarterly archives hold fixed versions of each entry; the material in them will not change.) Contributing libraries will be able to download our archives as a single compressed file. By downloading and storing our quarterly archives, you will not simply be licensing the right to examine the material, but you will be building you collection and thereby playing an important role in archiving scholarly material. (Note: the right to actually serve the archives to your constituents will vest only if the SEP project should ever terminate.)
  6. The SEP will ‘brand’ pages delivered to contributing institutions. Once an institution has registered and paid membership dues to SEPIA, they will be able to send us a list IP addresses. We will stamp the pages going to those IP addresses with a "thank you banner" which says something like: Open access to the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy has been secured, in part, with a contribution from the <Unit Name or List of Unit Names> at <University or College Name>".
  7. Umbrella library organizations get representation on a Governing Board, and receive annual reports, and by contributing, would be able to give input to the representatives.
  8. Contributing libraries get to play a role in keeping the SEP free for everyone — becoming part of the solution to the free-rider problem.
  9. Library contributions will play a role in helping to eliminate the collections crisis that has been created by the high pricing structure of many commercial publishers. Indeed, the SEP has been approached by Kluwer and other publishers to form a partnership (the result of which would be funding by ongoing subscriptions and thus a new ongoing cost for libraries). Academic librarians are now urging their faculty "to consider taking over the publication and distribution of research within your scholarly community" (quoted from "What You Can Do", distributed by The Academic Senate Library and The Library at the University of California/Berkeley). The community of academic philosophers has taken such a step and we hope libraries will support this. By helping to make the SEP's funding model a success, contributing libraries will help the SEP to set an example as a model that other humanities publications could use to maintain free access.

How to Contribute

We hope you will be convinced by our summary of the reasons for library participation and that you will contact your consortium and ask them to register your commitment. Alternatively, you may register your commitment directly. SOLINET has created a web page for registering these commitments:

SOLINET SEP Commitment Registration page

We hope you will choose to join us in this effort!

Yours,
The SEP Project Members
John Perry, Faculty Sponsor
Edward N. Zalta, Principal Editor
Colin Allen, Associate Editor
Uri Nodelman, Assistant Editor