Notes to Affirmative Action
1. Preferences for women don’t figure into the current controversy because women have no trouble competing for college admissions. 2020 data from the U.S. Census Bureau show women make up 57% of all college students and 60.7% of all graduate students. Regarding elite institutions, the following example is representative. The 2022 entering class at Harvard College consisted of 738 men and 906 women; the 2023 entering class at Harvard Law School was 51% female. The story is quite different for African Americans and Hispanics. Of the 30,631 University-wide enrollment at Harvard in 2022, 6% of students were black and 9% were Hispanic, and these numbers would have been lower had Harvard not been using race-conscious affirmative action in its admissions.
2. So profound was the shock to the academy that Nicholas Capaldi, writing in 1985, remained under the impression that “[a]ffirmative action as a public policy was first applied on a massive and national scale to institutions of higher learning” (Capaldi 1985, 1).
3. Ironically enough, the first discussions of “inverse” discrimination began in one of the prime sites of analytical philosophy, Analysis. For the full record of exchanges, see Nickel 1972; Cowan 1972; Taylor 1973; Shiner 1973; Silvestri 1973; Nunn 1974; Nickel 1974; Goldman 1975; Ketchum & Pierce 1976; Woodruff 1976; and Simon 1978.
4. See also Fullinwider 1975, Goldman 1979 (65–102), and Fullinwider 1980 (30–44).
5. Similar sentiments were expressed by Virginia Black:
If it is irrational and unjust and cruel to fire someone because he is a black or she is a woman—cases whose absurdity seems obvious—then it is equally irrational and unjust and cruel to hire someone because be is a black or she is a woman. To appreciate the parallel, one has only to remember that to hire X because of color is, ipso facto, not to hire Y because of color. When inscribed in law, this is racism. (Black 1974, 106).
See also Capaldi 1998, 535, 536 (affirmative action is “incoherent” in practice and “illogical”).
6. This idea that using racial preferences involves a kind of practical contradiction was given voice and support at the highest levels of government in the 1980s. William Bradford Reynolds, during his tenure as Assistant Attorney General for Civil Rights in the Reagan Administration, contended:
[T]o those who argue that we must use race to get beyond racism …[h]istory teaches us all too well that such an approach does not work. It is wrong when the government bestows advantages on whites at the expense of innocent blacks; it assumes no greater claim of morality if the tables are turned…. Whatever group membership one inherits, it carries with it no entitlement to preferential treatment over those not similarly endowed with the same immutable characteristics. Any compromise of this principle is discrimination, plain and simple, and such behavior is no more tolerable when employed remedially, in the name of “affirmative action” or “racial balance,” to bestow a gratuitous advantage on members of a particular group, than when it is divorced from such beneficence and for the most invidious of reasons works to one’s disadvantage. (Reynolds 1984, 1004).
While Reynolds found the proposition, “Use race to achieve a colorblind society,” an assault on common sense, he belonged to an administration—like a long line of previous administrations—whose defense policy was grounded on the proposition, “Prepare for war in order to have peace.”
7. For an early statement of the anti-caste principle, see Fiss 1976.
8. Am I not overlooking one fruitful source of understanding equality, namely the egalitarian principles in John Rawls’ A Theory of Justice (1971) and subsequent works? I think not. Rawls’ theory of “justice as fairness” is not designed to provide guidance on practical affairs facing citizens and leaders in this or that historical moment and place. It is foremost an answer to a philosophical question: how is it possible there can be political legitimacy (Rawls 2001, 40)? The problem is framed and addressed at a high level of abstraction. The principles Rawls defends apply to the “basic structure” of a “well-ordered” society understood “as a society … [effectively] regulated by some public (political) conception of justice” (Rawls 2001, 9). Answers to questions of here-and-now practice and policy require the operations of a thick layer of actually existing institutions (Rawls 2001, 10–11, 51). Those not familiar with Rawls’ theory should visit the entry on him in this encyclopedia [available here].
Nevertheless, two writers have attempted to wring some substance from Rawls. Robert S. Taylor (2009) argues that Rawls’ principle of fair equality of opportunity implies quite definite policy restrictions on affirmative action. In particular, the principle rules out using racial preferences to overcome the legacy of disadvantage engendered by our society’s long history of racial oppression. The crux of Taylor’s complaint against such preferences is this: the “spirit” of fair equality of opportunity lies in its “pure proceduralism.” A “fair distribution” of jobs and college slots “is simply whatever emerges from a fair procedure, designed as one that neutralizes social contingencies” such as class-position, wealth, and the like (Taylor 2009, 493). If these contingencies aren’t neutralized and some groups continue to suffer unjust disadvantages, it nevertheless is not open to us to use a tool like racial preferences to mimic the distribution of benefits that would have obtained otherwise. “[W]e simply cannot know what the counterfactual results of a ‘clean’ competition would look like” (Taylor 2009, 494). D. C. Matthew (2015) and Kristen Meshelski (2016) take issue with Taylor’s argument. They accuse him of misunderstanding how pure procedural justice works (Meshelski 2016, 437, 439) and what it implies for nonideal circumstances (Matthew 2015, 334). They dispute that we are hopelessly ignorant of outcomes under ideal conditions (Meshelski, 440–441) or that ignorance is disabling (Matthew, 333–334).
Matthew Adams (2021) believes he can step around Taylor’s argument by locating the fulcrum of affirmative action policy in Rawls’ basic liberties principle, which is “lexically prior” to the fair equality of opportunity principle.
First, I use a contractualist framework to derive a nonideal principle of justice that applies in all empirical conditions. Second…I argue that, given the particular empirical conditions that obtain in the contemporary US, this nonideal principle of justice supports affirmative action [By “nonideal,” Adams means the assumption that all the members of society comply with the principles that apply to them drops out.]
Although my approach is Rawlsian, it … abandons one Rawlsian orthodoxy. Rawls argues that justice exclusively regulates the basic structure: the main institutions of society.
In contrast, I assume—at least in nonideal conditions—that justice has direct implications for university policies, like affirmative action (Adams 2021, 319–320).
The principle Adams then derives—“baroque” by his own designation—spills over two pages. It is hard to see how this nonideal principle isn’t simply ad hoc. Why, anyway, grapple with the cumbersome and intricate machinery of “justice as fairness,” rather than compose a simpler and intuitive contractualist account like Alan Goldman’s (1979) to buttress a policy like affirmative action?
9. For example, in 1992, when Cheryl Hopwood filed a law suit against the University of Texas Law School, it was using a two-track admissions policy in which applications from African-Americans and Hispanics were evaluated separately—“and against more lenient standards”—from other applications. See Hopwood v. Texas 1994, 561–2, 563, 575.
10. See Koppelman and Rebstock (2007) for an argument that admissions schemes never provide “truly individualized consideration.” See Lippert-Rasmussen (2011) for why not being treated as an individual may be desirable.
11. Consider the waffling in the University of Texas brief in Fisher. The University claims to operate with a “broad vision of diversity”. It goes on: “The educational benefits of diversity include, but are not limited to, bringing unique and direct perspectives to the issues and topics discussed and debated in classrooms, promoting cross–racial understanding, breaking down racial and ethnic stereotypes, and creating an environment in which students do not feel like spokespersons for their race” (University of Texas 2015, 5). All of the benefits listed here, including the “unique and direct perspectives,” refer to upshots of racial diversity, though the sentence begins with “diversity” unmodified and within an initial framing of a “broad vision.” But maybe there is something to be said for waffling. Daniel Sabbagh (2007) argues that muddled, ambiguous justifications of affirmative action may be essential to sustaining it.
12. General Becton wrote:
Fully integrated enlisted ranks make integration of the officer corps essential to the effective operation of our military. But, the military did not learn this lesson without first experiencing the dangerous and destructive environment of a racially diverse enlisted corps commanded by an overwhelmingly white officer corps. As a direct result of the lessons learned in the 1960s and 1970s [during the Vietnam War], the military is now fully committed to officer corps integration. And while the armed forces have made remarkable strides in achieving racial integration, the military cannot lose ground (Consolidated Brief 2003, 13).
A principal way the service academies bring in black and Hispanic students is by identifying promising but “unfinished” applicants and enrolling them in their “prep schools,” whose student bodies exhibit a significant over-representation of minorities. A second way the services create officers is through college ROTC programs. Recruitment into ROTC is race-conscious, as is awarding of ROTC scholarships.
13. To find that Harvard discriminated against Asian Americans applicants in violation of Title VI and the Fourteenth Amendment, the Chief Justice would have had to contend that Harvard’s policy not only had a “negative effect” on those applicants but that the negative effect was intended, not just a foreseeable side-effect of policy. SFFA argued this latter claim at every level of litigation but neither the District Court nor the Court of Appeals found it credible (SFFA 2019, 146–149; SFFA 2020, 195–198). The Chief Justice did not directly address the claim. Rather, he used a bit of logic: admissions is a zero-sum affair; if more students from one race or ethnicity get in, fewer from other races or ethnicities get in; so, Harvard’s policy had a negative effect on some applicants. This for him made the policy impermissible. The Chief Justice noted the District Court’s finding that Harvard’s preferences for blacks and Hispanics resulted “in fewer Asian American and white students being admitted” (SFFA 2023, 27, quoting SFFA 2019, 178, emphasis added).
14. Students for Fair Admissions v. United States Military Academy (Southern District, New York), Case 7:23-cv-08262; and Students for Fair Admissions v. Department of Defense (District, Maryland), Case 7:23-cv-02699.
15. Legacies favor the children of a school’s alumni. Why is this unfair? Consider another form of favoritism. The children of residents of Maryland are favored for admission to the University of Maryland at College Park. Students whose parents reside in other states pay a much higher tuition bill if they do get admitted, and in any case there’s a limit on how many out-of-staters can be accommodated. Why this favoritism? It’s obvious, you reply. The residents of Maryland pay taxes that support the University; of course their children should get priority. This answer is incomplete. After all, for private institutions their alumni are their “taxpayers.” They draw support not from a geographically bounded political jurisdiction imposing mandatory contributions (taxes) but from a geographically dispersed constituency (their alumni) who “tax” themselves voluntarily. Why should one set of “taxpayers” get favorable terms of admission for their children but another set not? A distinctive feature of post-secondary education in the United States is its extensive array of private colleges and universities. Most are not in Harvard’s league with its $51 billion endowment. They depend on loyal alumni financially to sustain themselves.
16. For MIT’s explanation on reinstating the SAT, see Schmill 2022.