1. Some theorists who have written extensively on the definition of art distinguish “functionalist” and “proceduralist” definitions (Davies 1991). Some do not employ that distinction. Some, including influential writers who have defended their own definitions, take the crucial distinction between definitions to lie in whether they conceive of art as a ‘cultural-kind activity’ or as a ‘natural kind activity’ (Dickie 2001). Another classification scheme for definitions holds that they are best distinguished by whether the approach taken is intensional or extensional (Dickie 2004). Others writing on the definition of art employ none of just-mentioned classification schemes (Carroll 2000; Stecker 2003; cf. Lopes 2014; Danto 2013; Mag Uidhir 2013).

The “functionalist” vs. “proceduralist” scheme for classifying definitions of art has, as indicated, been appealed to by some (Carroll 1993, Osterman 1998, Abell 2011); ignored by some (Stecker 2005, Carroll 2000); and selectively appealed to by others who have written extensively on the issue and put forward their own definitions (Levinson 2005a, Stecker 2005, Carroll 2001). “Functional” definitions are said to be those according to which, necessarily, artworks perform a function or functions distinctive to art. “Procedural” definitions are said to hold that all artworks are “created in accordance” with certain “rules” and “procedures” (Davies 1991). The clarity of the notion of “proceduralism,” absent a formal characterization of what a procedure is, has been questioned: if absolutely any sequence of action is a “procedure,” then the term is overbroad (Stecker 1997, p. 67). More fundamentally, it has been urged by Stecker, “proceduralism” amounts to the view more commonly known as institutionalism – “pace Davies, who would claim that the latter is a species of the former” (Stecker 1997, p. 66). Other considerations bearing on the usefulness of the functionalist/proceduralist classification-scheme include the following: not all definitions fit under one or the other side of the distinction (Levinson 2005c); some definitions are hybrid (Stecker 1995, Levinson 2005c); some are hard to classify (Levinson 2005c); historical and narrative definitions, discussed in the entry, do not fit under either heading (Levinson 2005c); and views like the Wittgensteinian cluster accounts of art (discussed in the entry) are not easily classifiable in terms of the distinction (Levinson 2005c).

2. “It is in works of art that nations have deposited the profoundest intuitions and ideas of their hearts; and fine art is frequently the key … to the understanding of their wisdom and their religion” (Lectures [1886, 13]).

3. If the contention that definitions of art shouldn’t focus on artworks seems outlandish, note that nothing in the title of the present essay requires that the primary focus of the definition be artworks.

4. The example, though not the analysis, is Searle’s (see Khalidi 2013). There are, moreover, social kinds that do not depend for their existence on people’s having thoughts about those kinds themselves. For example a person can be racist, or an economic state a recession, even if no one regards anyone as a racist or anything as a recession, and even if no one regards any conditions as sufficient for counting as racist or as a recession. (Thomason, “Foundations for a Social Ontology,” Protosociology 18–19, pp. 269–290) If art and art’s associated kinds are like that, then, contrary to every version of institutionalism, extra-institutional artworks can exist.

5. See Lopes 2014, 110. Actually the degree of arbitrariness should not be exaggerated; Lopes also suggests that when new arts come into existence they do so on the basis of analogies to other arts, which presumably means that new arts share significant properties with existing ones.