Bioethics and Moral Reasoning

First published Thu Nov 5, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following entry replaces and is based on the former entry titled Theory and Bioethics.]

Bioethics refers to a branch of applied ethics that examines the ethical issues emerging from medicine, the life sciences, and science more generally.[1] This entry focuses upon approaches to or methods of moral reasoning in bioethics. What follows is a discussion of the main methodological movements in normative bioethics, as well as of recent work on the relation between bioethics and moral theory, and the relation between bioethics and philosophy. Much of the focus is on bioethics as an academic pursuit.

1. Approaches to Moral Reasoning in Bioethics

1.1 Bioethics and Standard Moral Theory

Confidence in the usefulness of moral theory in addressing the issues of bioethics is evident in the introductions to bioethics textbooks, many of which include discussions of at least the basics of consequentialism, virtue ethics, and deontological ethics.[2] Standard moral theories have provided the groundwork for many approaches to bioethics. For example, there is Kantian-inspired work such as Alan Donagan’s writing on informed consent (Donagan 1977) and Onora O’Neill’s Autonomy and Trust in Bioethics (O’Neill 2002); libertarian critiques of redistribution in health care (Engelhardt 1986 [1996]); Robert Veatch’s contract-based theory of medical ethics (Veatch 1981); Joseph Fletcher’s utilitarian approach to a broad range of issues in bioethics (Fletcher 1974); R. M. Hare’s utilitarian approach (Hare 2002, 2009); and virtue ethics approaches (Hursthouse 1991; Oakley 2013).

Using standard moral theories in approaching the issues of bioethics is an attractive option for several reasons. For instance, moral theories provide structured and systematic moral guidance (Gert et al. 2006; Nussbaum 2000; Louden 1992; Louden 1990; Clarke 1987; Clarke and Simpson 1989). Besides offering guidance, moral theory provides the resources for moral justification, especially important in bioethics where often public accountability is a factor (Nussbaum 2000). As well, when we appeal to mid-level principles (such as the principle of justice or the principle of beneficence), we sometimes need help in weighing, balancing, and adjudicating between those principles. Moral theory can provide a form of moral standard that can facilitate such resolution. Take Sidgwick’s argument in support of utilitarianism, that it can provide guidance in resolving conflicts among ordinary duties that everyday moral thinking cannot resolve on its own (Sidgwick 1874 [1981]). In a similar vein, Martha Nussbaum defends the need for moral theory in part by emphasizing its power in helping us weigh various rules against each other through its setting of this sort of normative standard (Nussbaum 2000).

But challenges with using standard moral theory when doing bioethics are much discussed. One, the range of credible ethical theories leaves open the question of which to apply. So there is the question of which moral theory should prevail, and it will be challenging to defend one’s preferred moral theory against its alternatives, given the range of respected ethical theories (DeGrazia 2024: 3; Arras 2003; Magelssen et al. 2016).

Two, there is moral theory’s potential for indeterminacy. Even if one has no trouble choosing and defending a particular moral theory, moral theory in general is often too abstract to generate straightforward answers to complicated applied problems (DeGrazia 2024: 3; Caplan 1980). DeGrazia uses the example of Kant’s Categorical Imperative. Even if one were to agree with it in the abstract, its usefulness in specific situations is questionable. To illustrate his point, DeGrazia uses the issue of triage decisions in emergency departments and questions of which patients should be given priority. The Kantian requirement to treat patients as ends in themselves, rather than as mere means, is too abstract an idea to offer practical guidance in this context. That challenge aside, there are disagreements within the ranks of any given theory. Consider rule versus act utilitarianism, for instance, or disagreement amongst Rawlsians.

Relatedly, some say standard moral theory is insufficiently fine-grained for actual policy making, that it is ill-equipped to deal with practical decision making on the concrete level in the public policy arena (Gutmann and Thompson 1998; Daniels 1996: 144–175; Daniels 2007: ch. 4). One’s preferred moral theory could endorse, for example, several possible policy options, leaving decision makers wanting for further guidance. For Will Kymlicka, the development of public policy on bioethical issues should be independent of moral theory. This is partly because he believes that public bodies should steer clear of endorsing any one moral theory. But besides that, on his view, public policy makers ought to take morality seriously, which is not the same thing as taking moral philosophy seriously. In fact, Kymlicka argues that taking moral philosophy seriously—whether that involves recourse to moral theory, or emphasizing the value of philosophical skill, or both—can actually run counter to taking morality seriously. This is because philosophy can obscure the ability to take people seriously, to show concern for their lives and interests. Kymlicka worries about the use of moral philosophy in this realm pre-empting policy-makers’ exercise of their ordinary moral sensibilities, as well as it undermining their confidence in them (Kymlicka 1996: 251, 261).

As well, recourse to moral theory can pose challenges in the clinical realm. Not only is the clinical ethicist likely to be surrounded by non-philosophers unschooled in moral theory, but they are also often in positions of public accountability. Why should the public to whom they are accountable be subject to their preference for one theory or another? As well, using theories in the prescribed way may be very demanding for the clinical ethicist without high level philosophical training. Furthermore, the comprehensiveness of the justifications promised by high moral theory may be unnecessary within that context (Magelssen et al. 2016: 27).

In sum, standard moral theory can be seen to have significant limitations as a method of treating bioethical issues. Partly as a response to such shortcomings, bioethics saw a move to forms of so-called “mid-level” theorizing.

1.2 The Principles-Based Approach

This development was evidenced most prominently by the 1979 publication of Tom Beauchamp and James Childress’ influential Principles of Biomedical Ethics. Now in its ninth edition, it is often characterized as an alternative approach to high level moral theory approaches to bioethics (Sumner 2024: 172; Battin 2005).

Each with different theoretical starting points (Beauchamp a rule-utilitarian, and Childress a Christian deontologist) (Arras 2017: 3; Beauchamp and Childress 1979: 40; Beauchamp and Childress 2019b: 9), Beauchamp and Childress set out to provide a moral framework that appeals to a pluralist and secular society. The principles-based approach does not presuppose any underlying theoretical or metaphysical commitments. The framework famously features four moral principles: 1) the principle of autonomy (which captures the value of self-direction regarding one’s life and choices), 2) the principle of beneficence (which requries that we enhance the welfare of others), 3) the principle of nonmaleficence (which obligates us to avoid imposing harm on others), and 4) the principle of justice (which, broadly understood, establishes the obligation to accord each person their due) (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a).

1.2.1 The common morality

These four principles are drawn from the idea of a common morality, a universal morality to which all morally serious persons are committed. The content of the common morality is dictated by the primary objectives of morality, which include the amelioration of human misery. It encompasses certain standards of action or rules of obligation (tell the truth, keep promises), and endorses certain standards of moral character or virtues, such as honesty and integrity. It upholds certain moral ideals (such as generosity) and supports human rights. These obligations, virtues, and ideals are on equal footing; no one area or type of norm has priority (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 4, 445, 455; Beauchamp and Childress 2019b; Arras 2017: 21–23). The common morality is historicist, in that its authority is established through the success of its related norms in advancing human flourishing across time. However, unlike many historicist accounts, the common morality is not relativist, as its norms apply universally: they are not merely local or cultural rules (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 445).

1.2.2 Specification and Balancing

The four principles on their own usually cannot provide concrete action guidance (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 17). The process of specification adds content to the principles and reduces their indeterminacy. Their scope is narrowed by “spelling out where, when why, how, by what means, to whom, or by whom the action is to be done or avoided” (Richardson 2000). Specification adds content to the principles—they need it, because “the complexity of the moral phenomena always outruns out ability to capture them in general norms” (Richardson 1990).

For example, taking the principle of respect for autonomy, one possible specification is “respect the autonomy of competent patients by following their advance directives when they become incompetent.” This specification will work well in certain situations; in others, a further or altogether different specification will be required. Further specification can continue indefinitely, and as this happens, those further specifications stay connected to the initial norm that confers their moral authority. When a problem is resolved through specification, this means that the content of a norm has been rendered sufficiently determinate such that it shows what should be done in a particular case (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 17).

When two or more principles come into conflict, they require balancing. Balancing involves judging and deliberating about the relative weights and strengths of competing moral norms. Balancing is not simply a matter of intuition: it requires nuanced judgment, astuteness, and sympathetic responsiveness. For one prima facie norm to be infringed in order to adhere to another, it must be that the moral objective that justifies the infringement must be realistically attainable.

As an example, the principles of autonomy and beneficence will often conflict with each other in situations of infectious disease outbreaks. Public health responsibilities may obligate governments to override the principle of autonomy (by mandating certain forms of quarantine, say). Such overriding may be justified by its being shown, among other things, that the quarantine has a realistic chance of preventing harm to others (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 22–23).

1.2.3 Justification: An Integrated Model

The model of justification endorsed by the principles-based approach is an integrated model, one that draws on both foundationalist and coherentist theories and aims to retain the best from each (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 439, 443). Rejecting both top-down modes of reasoning (as exemplified by Gert 1998; Gert et al. 2006) and bottom-up approaches (approaches using inductive reasoning, such as various versions of casuistry), Beauchamp and Childress opt for a model that emphasizes coherence while moving beyond it by also endorsing a foundationalism.

This account relies upon John Rawls’ notion of reflective equilibrium. (For a detailed discussion, see the entry on reflective equilibrium.) In short, reflective equilibrium is “a way of bringing considered judgments, principles, and background theories into a state of equilibrium or harmony, that is, coherence” (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 440; they direct readers to Rawls 2003 and Rawls 2005). Beauchamp and Childress make the four principles the considered judgments, which are provisionally acceptable without argumentative backing, and thereby provide foundational support (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 440). The common morality is the foundationalist aspect of their account. Moral conclusions are justified through both coherence (via the method of reflective equilibrium), and through foundationalism, being connected as they are to principles which are underwritten by the common morality (Arras 2017: 23; Beauchamp and Childress 2019b: 11). A central role is given to coherence (achieved through reflective equilibrium), with the four principles (considered judgments) providing foundational support (Beauchamp and Childress 2019: 440). Each serves as a constraint on the other.

1.2.4 Criticisms of the principles-centered approach

That the approach avoids a single overarching principle in favor of the (not lexically ordered) four moral principles has lead some to criticize the approach for an alleged lack of systematicity—a fatal flaw, according to some, in any philosophical theory (Gert et al. 2006). Such critics claim that without a clear prioritizing of principles, Beauchamp and Childress’ principles-centered approach lacks rigor and leaves too much room for intuitive judgments in cases where principles conflict. We should note that Beauchamp and Childress describe themselves as offering a framework (rather than a theory) (Beauchamp and Childress 2019b: 10). They also doubt that any priority ranking of their principles would stand the test of time (Arras 2017: 6–9).

Another criticism comes from John McMillan, according to whom Beauchamp and Childress’ approach stifles careful reflection about real issues. McMillan claims that principle-centered methods cannot lead to the formulation of well-reasoned convictions about moral questions. His view seems to be that the four principles approach hinders bringing moral reason to bear upon practical questions. This is because newcomers to bioethics will subsume whatever issues are under consideration under one of the four principles and then rule that the principle of autonomy should trump the other three principles. While recognizing that such a method is not what Beauchamp and Childress intended, McMillan writes that it is in fact the way the four principles approach is typically employed (McMillan 2018: 51–53).

Two further criticisms come from John Arras. Arras questions the plausibility of Beauchamp and Childress’ hybrid account of justification, specifically the account’s reliance upon the common morality as a foundation. Arras wonders how much additional justificatory advantage is leveraged by appealing to the foundational common morality, as reflective equilibrium itself is maximally inclusive of all pieces of the moral picture (including, presumably, the common morality’s norms). The problem, as Arras has it, is the conception of the common morality as being in its own moral sphere, removed from reflective equilibrium’s dialectic. Arras is skeptical that the common morality is in fact untouched by the vicissitudes of time and the dialectics of reflective equilibrium (Arras 2017: 24–26).

A second criticism from Arras deals with Beauchamp and Childress’ embrace of wide reflective equilibrium. According to Arras, it is difficult to comprehend how moral principles can retain their priority in conceptual analysis in the face of this endorsement of wide reflective equilibrium (Arras 2009 [2017: 182–183]). Arras asks us to recall that within wide reflective equilibrium, no single cluster of moral considerations (e.g. considered case judgments, background theories, moral principles) is privileged. What matters in reflective equilibrium’s revising process is our level of commitment to those considerations, rather than the form of the commitments themselves (Scanlon 1992; DePaul 1993 [2011: 57]). Our beliefs about principles, just like our beliefs in background theories and considered case judgments, are always subject to revision. The principles-centered approach seems to have sacrificed its methodological distinctiveness, so Arras’ criticism goes, given how principles appear to have been robbed of their conceptual priority.

Finally, Matthew Shea criticizes the principles-based approach for not endorsing a value theory or “a theory of the good” (Shea 2020). Where the principles-based approach is intended to be consistent with a range of value-based moral theories (like consequentalism and virtue ethics), it itself is not a value-based approach (i. e. its principles are not grounded in some foundational account of the human good ) (Shea 443). Shea argues that this is a problem, in that both specification and balancing in fact require a commitment to a specific value theory. (Note goes here.) Starting with specification, and taking the principles of beneficence and non-maleficence, Shea holds that without a value theory informing an account of what is good and bad for persons, we cannot determine what benefits and harms people (and so cannot fill in the content of and utilize these two principles). Regarding balancing, Shea examines Beauchamp and Childress’s appeal to practical wisdom in addressing how to resolve conflicts between principles. This appeal, Shea argues, is incomplete without a value theory, since practical wisdom involves prioritizing various goods in particular circumstances. It requires judging their relative importance and deciding which should be pursued. The appeal to practical wisdom requires a background value theory to inform such prioritizing and judgement-making, and so does the principles-based approach overall.

Beauchamp and Childress address a range of putative misunderstandings of their approach; here we consider two. The first is that the framework represents American individualism, with the principle of autonomy taking priority. They contest any connection between American individualism and a respect for autonomy, and they emphasize that their framework’s principles are all only prima facie binding. The second is that their approach downplays the virtues. It has been argued that medical ethics should be underwritten by virtue-based ethics rather than by principle-based ethics, that virtue ethics has a better chance of restoring humanity to health care (de Zulueta 2015). Here, Beauchamp and Childress point to various discussions of virtue theory and moral character appearing in various editions of their book, including a discussion in the eighth edition of how virtues and principles might work together in certain practical scenarios (Beauchamp and Childress 2019b: 11).

1.3 Casuistry

Some approaches to bioethics are defined less by the substance of their central ethical principles than by the methods they use to address moral questions (DeGrazia and Millum 2021: 2). This seems true of casuistry, an approach to bioethical reasoning that uses case comparison and analogy to reach moral conclusions. Casuists are generally skeptical of rules, rights, and general theories that are divorced from or developed independently of cases. Albert Jonsen and Steven Toulmin are two prominent proponents of this approach (Jonsen and Toulmin 1989). Actual cases, rather than any one moral theory, are the starting point; casuistry is a bottom up, rather than a top down, approach (Arras 2017: 11). When confronting a new case, the casuist analogizes to relevantly similar past cases. One recollects such a case, recalls how one responded in that case, and uses that reasoning in dealing with the current case. For the casuist, we are almost always more secure in particular moral conclusions than we are in the principles or theories that govern such conclusions. Moral certitude is found in judgments about particular cases, precedent cases, and practical reasoning, not at the top in theories, principles, or theoretical reasoning.

There are two basic versions of this approach. There is casuistry understood as the practice of addressing cases through the application of already-established principles. Understood as such, casuistry would seem to complement approaches that take moral principles to be morally binding (Arras 1991 [2017: 46]). On this view of casuistry, principles have an action-guiding or normative force that is not reducible to our responses to cases, and the moral knowledge represented by such principles is not reducible to responses to cases (Jonsen 1995).

There is a more radical interpretation of casuistry, on which principles develop through our analysis of actual cases (Arras 1991 [2017: 47]). Here, moral principles are merely formalizations of our intuitive responses to cases, without independent normative force (Toulmin 1981). According to its proponents, casuistry offers the chance of reaching agreement amongst those of different theoretical commitments, rendering it particularly well-suited for decision making in a pluralistic society (Sunstein 1996 [2014]).

Moral debate can become interminable when it suffers from a gridlock of conflicting principles or disagreement about moral theory; such impasses can be avoided by focusing on points of shared agreement. Toulmin makes this point in recounting his experience on the National Commission for the Protection of Human Subjects of Biomedical and Behavioral Research (Toulmin 1981). Agreement amongst members of the commission was relatively easy to reach even on difficult cases, and in the face of thoroughgoing moral theoretical disagreement amongst members. According to Toulmin, this shows us that bioethics is not and should not be a matter of applying a theory to a problem. There can be agreement on how to resolve a practical issue amongst those who strongly disagree on which moral theory ought to prevail. Toulmin’s experience prompted him to wonder what final appeals to principles really achieve.

Some say in the applied medical context, casuistry is particularly well-suited to use by health care workers, whose orientation is already case-focused, and whose time for and interest in moral theory is likely limited (Arras 1991 [2017: 55–57]). Others hold that it is ill-suited for use in direct patient care (Bleyer 2020). It is alleged this is because casuistry is a procedure of ethical learning, rather than a method focused on resolving complex clinical situations under time pressure.

There are several worries about casuistry. Some are concerned that casuistry wrongly assumes a straightforwardness when it comes to deciding what counts as a case, and hold that casuistry remains silent on this issue. Deciding what counts as a case (or not) might be underwritten by the bioethicist’s picture of the sorts of problems worthy (or unworthy) of appearance on the moral agenda (O’Neill 1988). It has been argued that that agenda is overly narrow and sculpted by the interests of the medical profession and a male outlook (Carse 1991). Another misgiving is that given its disregard for theoretically-derived principles, radical casuistry may simply be a refinement of our intuitive responses to cases. Relatedly, it might be morally conservative, ill-equipped for social critique, with the casuist as mere expositor of pre-ordained moral norms (Arras 1991 [2017: 60–67]; Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 438, and p. 462, note 39). Further, the approach seems to require pre-established agreement on fundamental values in order to reach conclusions, agreement likely lacking in pluralistic modern society.

Another criticism is that casuists seem to assume that analogical reasoning is self-standing. However, analogical reasoning would seem to need pre-established principles to give it direction, and radical casuistry rejects such principles. Finally, if the case chosen as the paradigm case was mishandled, certain mistakes can persist as the moral reasoner brings that reasoning to bear on the current case (Beauchamp and Childress 2019a: 437).

1.4 Narrative Ethics

A further approach to moral thinking and reasoning in bioethics is narrative ethics. Narrative ethics is generally regarded as a response to the use of standard moral theory, and to its supposed impartialist emphasis on objectivity and universality (Arras 1997 [2017: 75]). Narrative approaches view moral principles as modifiable in light of context (presumably by being made more specific, or by being treated as defeasible): the particulars of a situation “either naturally take a narrative form or must be given a narrative structure if they are to have moral meaning” (Nelson 1997: viii-ix).

Narrative ethics emphasizes storytelling, the importance of the voice and perspective of the storyteller and/or patient, and a literary sensibility on the bioethicist’s part. Possibilities have been proposed as to what a narrative approach might entail, suggestions as to the sorts of activities in which we might engage when we adopt a narrative approach. These include i) reading stories (which sharpens one’s moral sensibilities) (Nussbaum 1990 [1992], 1995 [2007]), ii) telling stories (which is a way of making moral sense of an experience), iii) comparing stories (which brings to mind the work of the casuists), iv) conducting literary analysis in some form or other, and v) invoking stories (which we do when we introduce bioethics case studies) (Nelson 1997: x-xii).

Accounts vary of how narrative ethics functions as a tool of ethical analysis.[3] One option is that a narrative approach acts as a supplement to moral theories and principles. On this version of narrative ethics, bioethics requires attention to the “narrative elements” of human experience, such as stories told by patients, caregivers, and family members. There is no thought of doing away with theories and principles, just a call to use them with an appreciation of the first-person accounts of others (Charon 1994).

A second option, sometimes known as historical narrative, emphasizes the importance of history and culture over a more universalist rationality. Here, right action is endorsed by appeal to the traditions, norms, and traditional stories of a particular social group. Recourse is made to one’s social role, and the foundational narrative underlying it. An example is the physician’s social role in Western culture as shaped by the Hippocratic Oath (MacIntyre 1981 [2007]; Burrell and Hauerwas 1977; Arras 1997 [2017: 86]).

Third, some see a narrative approach acting as a substitute for the process of moral justification (Arras 1997 [2017: 91–98]), and as a replacement of theory-driven or principles-centered bioethics. On this option, which some associate with postmodernism, the emphasis is upon continual conversation between traditions and narratives. The ultimate goal here then is not the pursuit of justification for one’s view, but the keeping open of the “moral space” for continuing conversation between rival views (Rorty 1989 [2012]). Another common element of this approach is the view that those who suffer should tell their own story, without risk of being dominated and objectified by the case summaries typical of modern medicine (Frank 1995 [2013]). While quite specific in their vision of how narrative ethics might supplement or replace a more standardly theory-driven or principles-centered approach to bioethics, none of these versions seem to identify a unique framework for moral reasoning (in the way that, for example, utilitarianism or deontology do).

Questions have been raised about the viability of a narrative approach. A general concern is that it is unclear how an emphasis on narrative relates to ethics in general. How does a narrative approach reach conclusions about what we are supposed to do? Insofar as two central tasks of bioethics are to pass judgments on actions, policies, and character, and to morally justify actions, decisions, and policies (or to show that justification is not possible), it is not clear how narrative ethics can satisfy the aims of bioethics, or so the concern goes. What is the relationship between narrative and moral justification? What is the connection between a person’s story, and the moral decency of an action or character?

More specific concerns about the approach track the version of narrative ethics under consideration. For instance, with respect to historical narrative (the second option above), some argue there is the risk of falling back into either a version of ethics at least somewhat guided by principles, or finding oneself having to sort through incommensurable narratives with nothing to decide between them. A worry about the third option (the version on which narrative acts as a substitute for moral justification) is the threat of an objectionable subjectivism, brought on by the possibility of mistaking the narrator’s story for ethical truth. A related criticism is that this version of narrative ethics seems to prioritize individual coherence. It might be that one can tell a story about an experience, or about one’s belief system which is coherent but at the same time morally questionable (Arras 1997 [2017: 96]).

1.5 Virtue Ethics and Bioethics

Virtue ethics has recently received increased attention as an approach to bioethics. It might at first blush seem as though virtue ethics is ill-suited bioethics. One reason is its focus upon the kind of person whose actions are under examination (Holland 2011: 96). Consider the virtue ethics criterion of right action, “do as the virtuous person would do” (Oakley 2013: 217–8, note 2). This might suggest that virtue ethics operates on the personal level, as opposed to on the societal level. And this might suggest that it is the wrong approach for bioethics since bioethics does often deal with societal-level questions and problems. Another reason is that there is some question as to the action-guiding power of virtue ethics. This concern is magnified within the current context as bioethics is taken to be essentially a practical discipline. But as Justin Oakley suggests, virtue ethics has in fact generated practical conclusions that have clarified various bioethics issues. A virtue ethics approach has recently been used in considering public health ethics (MacKay 2022) and human enhancement (Farrelly 2007). And more classic virtue ethics treatments of bioethics issues include Philippa Foot on euthanasia (Foot 1977) and Rosalind Hursthouse on abortion (Hursthouse 1991).

1.6 Feminist Approaches to Bioethics

As difficult as it might be to characterize a feminist approach to bioethics (Rogers 2017: 579; Jaggar 1989), the approach has some key features, many of which are familiar from discussion of feminist ethics. Some examples are that it pays special attention to lived experience, to power dynamics and social context, to empirical investigation, and to the perspectives of subordinated social groups. It involves a move away from theoretical abstraction and toward prioritizing the perspective of the subject(s), and gender is taken as a crucial analytic category (Rogers 2017: 587–588). There is also an emphasis on developing practical guidance on subverting the subordination of women (Jaggar 1989) and seeking to change relations of oppression and domination (Sherwin 1992).

Susan Sherwin’s view on the moral permissibility of abortion exemplifies some of these key characteristics. First, it draws upon empirical observation and fact. Second, and at the same time, it attends to lived experience. For example, her view references the lived costs of unwanted pregnancy (having to put education or a career on hold, having fewer resources to care for existing children), and of the difficulty for some people in avoiding pregnancy in the first place (Sherwin 1992: 99–103). Third, her view gives primacy to the perspective of members of subordinated groups, in this case to pregnant people’s perspectives. For instance, on Sherwin’s view, it is the pregnant person that assigns value (or does not) to the fetus (Sherwin 1992: 110–111; Sherwin 1991: 335–336). This is in contrast to many non-feminist accounts, according to which the fetus has independent moral status.

Third, her approach exemplifies a move away from abstract principles and theorizing. Because the abortion decision is complex and deeply personal, Sherwin holds that the pregnant person is best positioned to judge whether abortion is the correct decision in response to their circumstances and should be left to them (Sherwin 1991: 328–329). Sherwin resists the idea that there is an objective principle or set of principles for weighing the different considerations and according to which it might or might not be a mistake to terminate a pregnancy.

Susan M. Wolf’s treatment of medical assistance in dying (or physician-assisted dying) provides an example of the use of gender as an analytic category. Her emphasis upon the significance of gender leads her to conclude that medical assistance in dying should not be legitimized. Pointing to the insidiousness of familiar images of feminine self-sacrifice, and to early prominent cases of physician-assisted dying in which the physician was male, the patient female, Wolf warns us of the dangers of the dynamic between the “powerful expert physician and the woman surrendering to his care” (Wolf 1996a: 293). Feminist scholars have also addressed clinical bioethics (Sherwin and Baylis 2003), and there we see an emphasis upon commitment to social change and addressing injustice in the depiction of the clinical ethicist as advocate. And in her articulation of a certain skepticism about bioethics as a discipline, Christine Overall objects to what she takes to be a moral and social conservatism inherent to bioethics (Overall 1996: 170).

Beyond considering the key characteristics of a feminist approach to bioethics, there are its contributions to moral reasoning. Two such contributions are relational autonomy theory and care ethics (Wolf 1996b; Rogers 2017: 585–586). Relational autonomy theory recognizes that autonomy is compatible with valuing and being involved in social relationships (Mackenzie and Stoljar 2000; see also the entry on feminist perspectives on autonomy). Its proponents urge that the competencies necessary to exercising autonomy are developed through socially significant relationships (they are “socially scaffolded”), and that constraints on autonomy can be both internal (low self-respect and low self-esteem) and external (lack of access to meaningful opportunities). This contrasts with more standard approaches to autonomy that ignore the intricacies of what is required for its exercise. Relational autonomy theory does have its criticism from within feminist scholarship. For instance, some hold that the assumption of the idealized social conditions under which relational autonomy is exercised is problematic (Khader 2020).

Turning to care ethics, it also gives weight to relationality and is an approach to bioethics and ethics more generally that emphasizes that relationships of dependency are often non-voluntary. This attention to dependency relationships acknowledges that many relationships are not between equals (Kittay 1999). This differs from non-feminist approaches, which are taken to assume an impartiality between moral agents. Another defining feature of a care ethics approach is an attention to the concept of vulnerability and the positions of the vulnerable. It has been noted that the concept of vulnerability is central to many bioethical issues. (For example, it grounds protections for research subjects and patients) (Rogers et al. 2023: 3). Leslie Bender assumes a care perspective in her support of medical assistance in dying. There, she encourages a move away from what she sees as a disproportionate focus on rights in this domain, and toward values such as compassion (Bender 1992). And some of the recent debates about medical assistance in dying in the Canadian context reflect a concern with vulnerability, in particular the vulnerability of women and the disabled (Grant 2024).

Earlier I noted that casuistry is an example of an approach to bioethics that is defined less by the substance of its central ethical principles than by the methods it uses to address moral questions. In the case of feminist approaches to bioethics, we almost see the opposite. That is, what is distinctive is not so much a particular method of approaching bioethical issues, but rather a commitment to certain social and political values. For a comprehensive discussion of this topic, see the entry on feminist bioethics.

1.7 A Theory of Bioethics

In their recent A Theory of Bioethics, David De Grazia and Joseph Millum develop a “dual-value” approach to bioethics. It features several related components. To start, reflective equilibrium is its method, where considered moral judgments (which may be very general, or may be about a specific case) are provisionally accepted. There are also two foundational values. The first is well-being, and they endorse a subjective theory according to which an individual’s interests are inherently tied to facts of their psychology. The second is respect for rights-holders. The scope of the theory is the set of sentient beings (all beings who have a welfare)—all sentient beings have moral status. And there are four mid-level principles: the principles of nonmaleficence, beneficence, distributive justice, and autonomy rights (DeGrazia and Millum 2021: 41–49; for a review and summary of the book see Blumenthal-Barby 2022). De Grazia and Millum recognize the alignment with Beauchamp and Childress’ principles, but hold that there are differences in how they are understood and applied. As DeGrazia describes the theory elsewhere, it is a theory that bridges consequentialism and deontology in virtue of positing the two foundations of well-being and respect for rights-holders (DeGrazia 2022).

DeGrazia and Millum apply their theory to a wide array of practical issues, such as human procreation, permissible risk in pediatric research, the right to refuse medical treatment, research on embryos, and the right to health care. The discussion of decision-making for patients in irreversibly unconscious states invokes their well-being theory to suggest that these patients do sometimes have interests. It can be useful to consider desires someone may have that could be relevant to her treatment while in an irreversible unconscious state, desires relating to her body and to specific interventions that might be used on them. People have desires regarding what will happen to them in such a state, desires whose satisfaction or frustration could affect their life stories (DeGrazia and Millum 2021:245–6). On the topic of embryo research, DeGrazia and Millum’s account of moral status supports their argument for its permissibility (DeGrazia and Millum 2021: 204–206).

2. Bioethics and Moral Theory

2.1 Does Bioethics need Moral Theory?

There is recent discussion of whether bioethics needs moral theory. Where at the start of this entry we briefly examined the use of standard moral theories in approaching bioethics issues, here we consider a general question about the usefulness of moral theory in treating the problems of bioethics. This question is more specific than questions about bioethics and moral reasoning, and also more specific than questions about the relation between bioethics and philosophy.

Wayne Sumner has recently suggested that bioethics might not need moral theory (Sumner 2024). He refers to his own 1980s work on the morality of abortion (Sumner 1981 [2014]) in which he attempted to ground his view on the morality of abortion in a moral theory (utilitarianism). Sumner now seems to think that was unnecessary and perhaps counterproductive. He wonders whether his position on abortion could have been developed just as effectively without invoking utilitarianism. But by the end of the relevant article, Sumner suggests that while ethical theory might not be necessary to the formulation of bioethical positions, it can help us formulate them. He wonders whether he could have supported his position on abortion just as well without having had utilitarianism in mind. In his case, his invocation of utilitarianism highlighted salient facts that turned out to be significant. For example, it offered an account of well-being that underscored the importance of sentience. The capacity for sentience was, in the end, defended as the basis for deciding whether, and when, fetuses have moral standing. In the end, Sumner concludes that while bioethics might not need ethical theories, using them along with other considerations may be beneficial.

David DeGrazia also examines bioethics’ need for moral theory, and argues that the strongest ethical arguments seldom rely upon an ethical theory (DeGrazia 2024).[4] He offers five examples of argumentative strategies that do not use ethical theories and are capable of changing people’s minds (such as “argument by analogy” and “appeal to an intuitively plausible norm”). DeGrazia holds that most strong ethical arguments do not presuppose the truth of a moral theory. He presents a picture of how such arguments are structured. They each use a confidently held (or “sturdy”) norm to reach a significant (and often surprising) result. So, for example, in Judith Jarvis Thomson’s “A Defense of Abortion” (Thomson 1971) the sturdy norm is the moral judgment that you may permissibly detach from the violinist even though doing so would lead to their death. The new idea is that your situation in relation to the violinist is relevantly similar to that of a pregnant person facing an unwanted pregnancy. The significant result is that abortion may be permissible in many circumstances, even on the assumption that the fetus is a person with full moral status (DeGrazia 2024: 5).

Søren Holm’s answer to whether bioethics can be done well without moral theory is mixed (Holm 2024). He begins by breaking down bioethics into three categories: critical bioethics (which challenges existing positions or arguments in the literature or in policy), empirical bioethics, and constructive bioethics (which seeks to advance arguments in support of a given position). With respect to the first two endeavours, Holm’s answer is yes, bioethics can be done well without moral theory. One does not need moral theory in order to point out that an argument is invalid, for instance, or that a conclusion in one area commits one to a much less comfortable conclusion in another area. Good empirical bioethics is also perfectly possible without moral theory. Consider the example of studying the implementation of a particular research ethics framework. One need not rely on a moral theory in investigating, for example, the reasons for any deviations from the framework.

But moving on to constructive bioethics, Holm takes matters to be less straightforward. His overall answer here is that the approaches to constructive bioethics that purport to be theory-free (such as the use of reflective equilibrium, or the use of mid-level and other free-standing principles) in fact rely more upon moral theory than it appears. For example, regarding reflective equilibrium, theoretical considerations are meant to exist alongside considered judgments and rules. So according to Holm, much of good constructive bioethics does rely on moral theory. He makes no direct claim about whether good constructive bioethics needs moral theory. Holm does say that without it, constructive bioethics would appear quite different from most current work in bioethics (Holm 2024:165).

Tom Beauchamp has argued that bioethics “needs … and stands to profit from” ethical theory, but that as yet philosophers have not developed theories that sufficiently engage with practice (Beauchamp 2004: 210). He suggests also that at the same time, many practical contributions lack theoretical depth. Beauchamp points to examples of work that is theoretically sophisticated but does not lend itself to practical application. For example, Beauchamp finds it difficult to see how reflective equilibrium can be put into practice. And as an example of the reverse shortcoming, he points to work that shows a deep engagement with the practical but does not offer theoretical grounds for its claims (Macklin’s treatment of relativism in bioethics). So for Beauchamp, while bioethics stands to gain from ethical theory, philosophers have in general done a poor job of linking theory to practice. He notes what he takes to be other drawbacks of ethical theories, such as the indeterminate nature of their norms and their often formidable character (Beauchamp 2004: 216).

2.2 Does Bioethics need Philosophy?

Jennifer Blumenthal-Barby and colleagues address the question of whether bioethics needs philosophy, a broader question than the question of whether bioethics needs theory. They argue that philosophy remains deeply relevant to bioethics. There are three main ways in which this is true. First, many concepts critical to current bioethics discussion are philosophically contested, and continued philosophical work on them is essential to the clarity of bioethical discussion. Examples of such concepts are dignity, coercion, the definition of death, and the idea of interests (Blumenthal-Barby et al. 2022: 11). Second, philosophers contribute expertise in articulating and applying ethical principles that play a central role in clinical bioethics. An example is the doctrine of double-effect. In a peer commentary response to the article, David DeGrazia raises several questions that require substantial philosophical input and have significant implications for bioethics. He writes that “one cannot but hope for further advances in (bio)ethical theory. Philosophy will be the principal driver of any such advances” (DeGrazia 2022: 28). He also suggests that philosophy is indispensable in addressing issues such as moral status, personal identity, and surrogate decision-making.

Third, philosophers are well-situated to address the conceptual and normative questions raised by emerging medical technologies. These technologies may call into question established assumptions about sentience, consciousness, and agency, and philosophy can help. Third, philosophers develop new ideas and theories of relevance to bioethics, for instance Fricker’s work on epistemic injustice (Fricker 2007), or Gendler’s concept of “alief” (Gendler 2008) (Blumenthal-Barby et al. 2022: 14)

2.3 Clinical Ethics and Moral Theory

There is discussion of the role of moral theory in clinical ethics consultation. Four important roles for moral theory in clinical ethics consultation have been suggested:

  1. aiding in the initial awareness and identification of the moral challenges;
  2. assisting in the analysis of moral challenges;
  3. contributing to a sound process and dialogue;
  4. inspiring an attitude of reflexivity and interpretation (Magelssen et al. 2016: 27–31).

The advantages of a clinical ethicist’s being familiar with moral theory have also been discussed. There is some advantage not just in using a moral theory to help one analyze and formulate arguments, but also in considering the variety of perspectives and questions made perspicuous by various ethical theories, and the issues they illuminate. Familiarity with moral theory can also help clinical ethicists develop their own arguments and spot weaknesses in their own arguments or others’.

However, knowledge of moral theory within the clinical ethics realm is not always clearly helpful, and its possible benefits are not without accompanying drawbacks. To start, it is possible for those with no training in moral philosophy to have a solid handle on the moral dilemma with which they are dealing. And at the same time, some say, having a philosopher, one who is an expert in moral theory, as a clinical ethicist does not guarantee that the ethics consult will be of high quality. First, if used too strictly, and adhered to too inflexibly, moral theories can hamper moral imagination and intuition, and obscure access to the insights of, for example, common morality. Second, those in command of a wide range of moral theories might be tempted to draw upon the moral theory that actually justifies a course of action already preferred or even settled upon, rather than use what is deemed in advance to be the best moral theory to work through what is the justifiable course of action (or what are the best action options).

Third, moral theories can mislead, by, for instance, being used to frame cases in ways that emphasize irrelevancies. And fourth, without quite advanced knowledge and skill, ethical theories may easily be misunderstood and used improperly. An example here would be taking Kantian moral theory to mandate no person ever being treated as a means (Magelssen et al. 2016). The message here is that knowledge of moral theory can sometimes actually be an impediment to good clinical ethics.

Recent discussion sees two new suggestions about the relation between Beauchamp and Childress’ principles-based approach and clinical ethics. Omelianchuk et al. argue that the approach is less helpful for the clinical ethicist than one might at first expect. The authors hold that the principles-based approach is neither necessary nor sufficient for clinical ethics, and that they themselves as clinical ethicists rarely use it. While they say it can be helpful in categorizing the relevant issues at stake in an ethics consult, or in facilitating communication between moral philosophy and the clinical realm, its weaknesses outweigh such strengths. One weakness is that the four principles are liable to give way to retrospective rationalizations of moral judgments rather than direct the formulation of action-guiding moral judgments. And drawing on John Arras, the authors suggest that even when the principles-based approach yields a specified rule that appears applicable to the case at hand, such a rule cannot adequately guide the complex interpretation of facts and relationships involved in clinical ethics consultation (Omelianchuk et al. 2026, 20–23).

Overall, moral theory has a role to play in clinical ethics, at least if we accept the goals of ethics consultation as assumed by the generally accepted model of ethics consultation. This is the ethics facilitation approach, which involves identifying and analyzing the moral issue at stake, and facilitating a principled ethical resolution (Kon et al. 2025). Moral theory can offer advantages to the clinical ethicist and the consultation process. At the same time, the discussion in the literature cautions against a wholesale endorsement of the notion that those working in clinical ethics are always better for having an in-depth knowledge of moral theory.

3. Conclusion

We have seen approaches to moral reasoning in bioethics shift from relying on standard moral theory to adopting mid-level approaches such as the principles-based framework. Further, some versions of casuistry and narrative ethics assume a stance that eschews the use of moral principles. Some of these positions are defined by the substance of their central tenets (for instance the principles-based approach). Others, such as casuistry, are defined more by the methods used to address bioethical cases or issues. And interestingly, many of these approaches to moral reasoning are in a sense distinctive to bioethics. We do not seem to see them at play or under discussion in other areas of moral inquiry, at least under the same label. Whether or not bioethics done well requires the use of moral theory is a matter on which there are varied perspectives. There is more solid agreement that bioethics needs philosophical research and knowledge.

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