Disjunction
In logic, disjunction is a binary connective (
- 1. Disjunction in classical logic
- 2. Non-classical variations
- 3. Disjunction in language
- 4. Disjunction in conversation
- 5. Inclusive and exclusive uses of or
- 6. Modal accounts of disjunction and free choice
- 7. Alternative-based accounts of disjunction
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1. Disjunction in classical logic
In classical logic, disjunction (
- (1)
- Disjunction in classical logic
1 | 1 | 1 |
---|---|---|
1 | 0 | 1 |
0 | 1 | 1 |
0 | 0 | 0 |
A disjunction
Adopting a natural deduction system, the proof-theoretical
contribution of disjunctive formulas can be defined by the following
two rules, which regulate (i) how disjunctions can be drawn as
conclusions (disjunction introduction rule,
- (2)
- Disjunction introduction (
)
- (3)
-
Disjunction elimination (
)
Intuitively, the former tells us that we can conclude
One of the goals of a logical system is to arrive at a rigorous
characterization of the notion of validity. In a logical system, which
normally consists of a language, a proof-theory and a model-theory,
validity can be defined proof-theoretically or model-theoretically.
Proof-theoretically, validity is defined in terms of formal proofs. An
argument is proof-theoretically valid (
Below are some of the principles involving disjunction that classical
logic validates. In the list we adopt the model-theoretic notation
(
These principles have been widely discussed and, at times, rejected in
the logical-philosophical literature. The following section briefly
summarizes parts of these discussions focusing on which alternative
interpretation of
Before proceeding a note on the origin of the symbol '
2. Non-classical variations
2.1 Law of excluded middle and the principle of bivalence
The law of excluded middle (LEM) states that any proposition of the
form
2.1.1 Disjunction in intuitionistic logic
LEM has been rejected in constructivism, in particular in
intuitionistic logic (see the entry on
intuitionistic logic).
The standard informal interpretation of logical operators in
intuitionistic logic is the so-called proof-interpretation or
Brouwer-Heyting-Kolmogorov (BHK). On such interpretation the meaning
of a statement
- (4)
- A proof of
consists of a proof of or a proof of .
On such interpretation, the question concerning the validity of LEM is
then equivalent to the question of the possibility of unsolvable
(mathematical) problems (Brouwer 1908, translated in Heyting (ed)
1975): LEM should then fail because it is doubtful that for any
mathematical statement
Related to its rejection of LEM, intuitionistic logic satisfies the
disjunction property (Gödel 1932). A logic is said to
have the disjunction property if whenever
The rejection of LEM in intuitionistic logic also implies the
rejection of classical reductio ad absurdum as a legitimate
method of (mathematical) proof. Intuitionistically, ad
absurdum one can only prove negative statements (via negation
introduction
Finally note that only one of the De Morgan laws is intuitionistically provable, of the other only one half still holds:
(De Morgan laws) , but
Intuitively,
2.1.2 Disjunction in multi-valued logics
The semantic principle of bivalence states that every proposition is
either true or false (and not both). Early arguments against bivalence
were linked to the problem of determinism. In De
Interpretatione (part 9), Aristotle discusses the status of
statements about contingent future events, and seems to conclude that
for these statements the principle of bivalence should be rejected,
otherwise determinism would follow. His argument can be reconstructed
as follows. Consider the statement A sea battle will be fought
tomorrow. If the statement is true, then the sea battle will
necessarily take place. If the sentence is false, then it will be
impossible for the sea battle to take place. Assuming that statements
are either true or false, one concludes that the sea battle is either
necessary or impossible. To escape this fatalistic conclusion
Aristotle rejects the principle of bivalence (while possibly retaining
the law of excluded middle, see van Fraassen 1966: 493–495, and
the entry on
fatalism).
Aristotle’s sea battle argument, although criticized by many,
constituted one of Łukasiewicz’ original motivations for
the development of his trivalent logic (Łukasiewicz 1920,
translated in McCall 1967). Since then various multi-valued logics
have been developed where formal disjunction
- (5)
- Disjunction in strong Kleene logic
1 | # | 0 | |
1 | 1 | 1 | 1 |
# | 1 | # | # |
0 | 1 | # | 0 |
On this interpretation, a disjunction is true if at least one of the disjuncts is true, false if both disjuncts are false, undefined otherwise.
In Bochvar’s internal three-valued logic, also known as Kleene’s weak three-valued logic, disjunction receives a different interpretation. The symbol # should be read here as meaningless:
- (6)
- Disjunction in weak Kleene logic
1 | # | 0 | |
1 | 1 | # | 1 |
# | # | # | # |
0 | 1 | # | 0 |
While on a strong Kleene interpretation, a disjunction can be true even if one of the disjuncts is undefined, on a weak Kleene interpretation, if one of the disjuncts is meaningless, the whole disjunction is meaningless as well.
Negation receives the following interpretation in these systems:
- (7)
- Negation in strong and weak Kleene logic
1 | 0 |
# | # |
0 | 1 |
In both strong and weak Kleene logics then,
The difference between the strong and weak Kleene’s treatment of disjunction can be better appreciated by looking at the phenomenon of presupposition, which constitutes one of the most well-known linguistic motivations for the rejection of bivalence (other common motivating phenomena include empty names, the semantic paradoxes and vagueness, see the entries on names, liar paradox and sorites paradox, and section 2.1.4 below). Consider Russell’s (1905) example:
- (8)
- The king of France is bald.
According to bivalence, (8) must be either true or false. Which is it? Russell’s answer is well known. According to his theory of descriptions (8) expresses the conjunction “there is a unique king of France and he is bald” of which the first conjunct is false, and therefore the whole sentence is false. Strawson (1950) however criticized Russell’s analysis and argued that the existence and uniqueness of the king of France is not part of what is asserted by an utterance of (8) rather it is part of what is taken for granted or presupposed. If there is no king of France, the sentence is not false, rather it is neither true nor false. Adopting a three-valued logic we can assign to (8) value #. Consider now the following three examples where (8) occurs in a disjunction.
- (9)
- Either the king of France is bald or the king of France is not bald.
- (10)
- Either there is no king of France or the king of France is bald.
- (11)
- Either Barack Obama is tall or the king of France is bald.
Both strong and weak Kleene systems predict (9) to be undefined/meaningless, since both disjuncts are undefined/meaningless. However, the predictions of the two systems with respect to (10) and (11) diverge: the strong Kleene system predicts both (10) and (11) to be true since at least one of the disjuncts is true (assuming Barack Obama is in fact tall), while the weak system predicts both (10) and (11) to be meaningless since at least one of the disjuncts is meaningless. Intuitively, however, (10) is true while (11) is more readily judged as undefined/meaningless. Thus the predictions of neither systems are in agreement with common sense judgments. Linguists have observed that the intuitive difference between (10) and (11) is that in the former, but not in the latter the existence of a unique king of France (the presupposition of one of the disjuncts) is entailed by the negation of the other disjunct. Karttunen (1973), who systematically studied the projection behavior of presuppositions (i.e., how the presupposition of a constituent projects at the level of the complex sentence), described disjunction as a filter. In his taxonomy of embedding operators, plugs block all presuppositions in their scope (an example is told that: I was told that the king of France is bald does not imply that there is a king of France), holes allow presupposition to project freely (e.g., negation: I didn't see the king of France does imply that there is a king of France), while filters allow only some presuppositions to project (e.g., implication: If everybody wears a wig, then the king of France is bald implies that there is a king of France, while If France is a monarchy then the king of France is bald doesn't; and conjunction: Everybody wears a wig and the king of France is bald implies that there is a king of France, while France is a monarchy and the king of France is bald doesn't). Thus implication, conjunction and disjunction are all examples of filters. Karttunen arrived at the following generalisation about their presupposition filtering conditions: In the case of implication, all presuppositions project (i.e., are not cancelled) except those triggered by the consequent and semantically entailed by the antecedent. In the case of conjunction, all presuppositions project except those triggered by the second conjunct and semantically entailed by the first conjunct. In the case of disjunction, all presuppositions project except those triggered by the second disjunct and entailed by the negation of the first disjunct. Various analyses have been proposed attempting to capture Karttunen's generalisation. A prominent example is Peters (1979), who showed how Karttunen’s observations can be accounted for within a multi-valued logic with special non-symmetric connectives (see the entry on presupposition for an overview).
2.1.3 Disjunction in dynamic semantics
Another influential attempt to formalize Karttunen’s
generalization with respect to presupposition projection, is the
dynamic account of Heim (1983), further developed in Beaver (2001). In
a dynamic semantics, the interpretation of sentences is given in terms
of their context change potentials rather than their truth conditions
(see the entry on
dynamic semantics).
A context (or information state)
- (12)
- Disjunction in dynamic semantics
The result of updating a context
- (13)
- Either the king of France is bald or there is no king of France.
This prediction however does not seem to be borne out.
A related discussion concerns the behavior of anaphora in the context of disjunction and in particular the challenge presented by the so-called “bathroom” example (14) from Barbara Partee, where the anaphoric pronoun it in the second disjunct refers back to the negative indefinite no bathroom in the first disjunct, while negative indefinites are normally inaccessible to subsequent pronouns as illustrated in (15):
- (14)
- Either there is no bathroom in the house, or it is in a funny place.
- (15)
- There is no bathroom in the house. # It is in a funny place.
The contrast between
(14)
and
(15)
seems to provide evidence for the analysis of disjunction presented
in
(12)
according to which the second disjunct must be interpreted with
respect to a context supporting the negation of the first disjunct (so
a context supporting the information that there is a bathroom in the
house). Note however that double negation elimination
It is easy to see that a dynamic semantics with presuppositions does
not validate LEM, because, if
2.1.4 Disjunction in supervaluationism
Another system which rejects bivalence while validating LEM is
supervaluationism (van Fraassen 1966). Let
Supervaluational semantics has been largely applied to explain
phenomena of vagueness (Lewis 1970; Fine 1975b; Kamp 1975; see also
the entry on
vagueness).
A predicate
2.1.5 Disjunction in quantum logic
Other logics that lack bivalence are quantum logics, which also
typically reject the distributive laws of classical logic (Birkhoff
and von Neumann 1936; Putnam 1968). Quantum logics were first
developed by Birkoff and von Neumann for studying the relation among
physical observables in quantum physics. Quantum logics reject
bivalence because a state in a quantum system typically assigns
probability values to experimental propositions rather than plain true
or false. To see why quantum physics can be taken to provide evidence
against the distributive laws of classical logic consider a particle
moving on a line. Suppose
Various ways have been proposed to develop a quantum logic which rejects the distributive laws while saving as much as possible of classical logic. One way discussed by Dummett (1978) (who was not a proponent of quantum logic) involves restricting the elimination rule for disjunction so that the distributive laws are no longer derivable (see Humberstone 2011: 298–302 and 918–922 for more details). Arguably more natural characterizations of quantum logic use algebraic semantics and probability theory (see the entry quantum logic and probability theory).
2.2 Disjunctive syllogism and addition
Disjunctive Syllogism (DS) states that we can infer
Historically, relevance logic rejected DS because of the role it plays
in C.I. Lewis “independent” proof of the fact that an
impossible proposition
1. | [assumption] | |
2. | [from 1, by | |
3. | [from 1, by | |
4. | [from 2, by | |
5. | [from 3,4 by disjunctive syllogism] |
According to Anderson and Belnap “the inference from
- (16)
- Either there is dirt in the fuel line or there is something in the fuel line.
Hurford’s constraint has more recently received some attention in the semantic/pragmatic literature because of its role in the debate between localist and globalist analysis of scalar implicatures (e.g., Chierchia, Fox, and Spector 2012).
Disjunctive syllogism is also invalid (or better quasi-valid) in
Priest’s Logic of Paradox (LP). In LP both
We conclude this section with a final remark on addition, which according to Anderson and Belnap does not hold for intensional disjunction. The validity of addition has also been disputed in relation to imperative logic. We don’t seem to be able to conclude (18) from (17) (Ross’ (1941) paradox):
- (17)
- Post this letter!
- (18)
- Post this letter or burn it!
One way to tackle this would be to treat or in (18) as a case of intensional disjunction. This solution however would fail to account for a characteristic aspect of the interpretation of disjunctive imperatives which arguably explains the failure of addition in these cases, namely their choice offering potential. The most natural interpretation of disjunctive imperatives is as one presenting a choice between different actions: (18) implies that you may post the letter and you may burn it (a free choice inference). Imperative (17) then cannot imply (18) otherwise when told the former one would be justified in burning the letter rather than posting it (e.g., Mastop 2005; Aloni 2007; Aloni and Ciardelli 2013). More on free choice in section 6.
3. Disjunction in language
From a linguistic point of view disjunction is a kind of coordination,
where coordination refers to syntactic constructions in which two or
more units of the same type are combined into a larger unit and still
have the same semantic relations with other surrounding elements
(Haspelmath 2007). An open question is whether disjunctive
coordination is a universal that can be found in all languages. All
languages appear to possess coordination constructions of some kind,
but not all languages seem to have explicit coordinators like
and and or. For example, Maricopa (a Yuman language
of Arizona described by Gill 1991) and Dyribal (an Australian
Aboriginal language described by Dixon 1972) seem to lack explicit
coordination structures, so in these languages there is no word
corresponding to or (see also Winter 1995). This does not
necessarily mean however that these languages lack a way to express
disjunctive meanings. Maricopa and Dyribal appear to be able to convey
“
- (19)
- Johnš John-nom Billš Bill-nom vɂaawuumšaa. 3-come-pl-fut-infer ‘John or Bill will come’
That it is the “uncertainty” suffix šaa
which is responsible for the disjunctive interpretation is evidenced
by the fact that if omitted the interpretation of the sentence becomes
conjunctive (Gil 1991). The close connection between linguistic
disjunction and uncertainty (or ignorance) will be further scrutinized
in the following sections. Let us now turn to languages which do have
specialized disjunctive words like or. A first difference
between logical disjunction (
- (20)
- John or Mary sang. (
John sang or Mary sang) - (21)
- Every man sang or danced. (
every man sang or every man danced)
Adopting an algebraic perspective Keenan and Faltz (1985) showed that we can capture all these uses identifying disjunction with the join operator in a Boolean algebra (or, simplifying a bit, set union), see the entry on the mathematics of Boolean algebra. In the special case of disjunction at the sentence level, the Boolean operator boils down to the classical propositional operator on truth values (see section 7.1 for a recent account which identifies disjunction with the join operator in a Heyting algebra, which at the sentence level yields a non-classical (inquisitive) propositional operator). As an illustration consider the following interpretation of generalized, cross-categorial or in terms of generalized union, adapted from Gazdar (1980) (see also Winter 2001). The crucial assumption behind this definition is that noun phrases like John or every man denote sets or functions rather than individuals (as in Montague 1973).
- (22)
- Generalized, cross-categorial disjunction
In the type-theoretical language adopted here each expression is
assigned a type. Expressions
- (23)
-
- a.
- John or Mary sang.
or
- b.
- Every man sang or danced.
One of the assumptions behind this cross-categorial analysis is that the input to the semantic component of grammar involves the units as coordinated at “surface structure” (i.e., no syntactic conjunction reduction, mapping non-sentential coordination to sentential coordination at “deep structure”). This is crucial for example to capture example (23b) where non-sentential disjunction could not be syntactically reduced to sentential disjunction without change of meaning. Rooth and Partee (1982) however discussed a number of counterexamples to such an analysis involving cases of wide-scope or in opaque contexts. Their famous example is repeated below (Rooth and Partee 1982: example (13)):
- (24)
- Mary is looking for a maid or a cook.
As Rooth and Partee observed the sentence has three readings: (i) the
normal de dicto reading, according to which Mary would be
satisfied if she found any maid and she would also be satisfied if she
found any cook (this reading can be generated by combining the verb
directly with the disjunctive noun phrase a maid or a cook);
(ii) the normal de re reading according to which Mary is
looking for a specific person and this person is either a maid or a
cook (this reading can be generated by quantifying in the disjunctive
noun phrase into the translation of the sentence Mary is looking
for him
4. Disjunction in conversation
There are various conclusions one normally draws from the assertion of a disjunctive sentence like (25):
- (25)
- Mary is patriotic or quixotic.
- a.
- at least one of the two is true
- b.
- at most one of the two is true [exclusive inference]
- c.
- speaker doesn’t know which is true [ignorance inference]
Since only (25a) follows from the classical truth-functional account
of disjunction, there seem to be a divergence in meaning between
Expanding on parts of Grice’s celebrated argument (Grice 1989: 44–46), suppose one would propose to analyze or in such a way that not only (25a) would logically follow from (25) but also (25b) and/or (25c). A major problem for such a strong analysis of or is that it would fail to account for the fact that both the exclusive and the ignorance inferences are easily cancellable. One can say Mary invited John or Bill or both (cancellation of exclusive inference), or The prize is either in the attic or in the garden. I know that because I know where I put it, but I am not going to tell you (cancellation of ignorance-modal inference, from Grice 1989: 45). A strong theorist could then respond that there are two senses of or, a strong one and a weak (truth-functional) one, with the latter employed in the previous cases of cancelation. But as Grice replied,
if or is supposed to possess a strong sense, then it should be possible for it (or) to bear this sense in a reasonably wide range of linguistic settings, for example it should be possible to say It is not the case that A or B where we are denying that
or (in the strong sense of or). (Grice 1989: 45)
That this is not possible is illustrated by the oddity of the following two cases: It is not the case that Mary invited John or Bill, because she invited both or It is not the case that the prize is either in the attic or in the garden, because I know that it is in the garden. Since strong senses of or seem to be restricted to “unenclosed” uses for which an alternative explanation is available, Grice’s conclusion is that only (25a) should be taken as part of the semantic contribution of the sentence (what is said). The exclusive and ignorance inferences in (25b) and (25c) are merely pragmatic effects (conversational implicatures) which derive from interactions between a weak (truth-functional) interpretation of or with general principles of conversation.
On Grice’s account, conversation is a purposeful and cooperative enterprise governed by what he calls the Cooperative Principle:
- (CP)
- Make your conversational contribution such as is required, at the stage at which it occurs, by the accepted purpose or direction of the talk exchange in which you are engaged.
Subsumed under this general principle, Grice distinguishes four categories of more specific maxims, including the maxim of Quantity (here simplified).
- Quantity
- (i)
- Make your contribution as informative as is required (for the current purposes of the exchange);
- (ii)
- Do not make your contribution more informative than is required.
Conversational implicatures are pragmatic inferences arising from the interplay between basic semantic content and these principles of social interaction. A speaker conversationally implicates what she must be assumed to believe in order to preserve the assumption that she is adhering to the CP and maxims.
Gricean reasonings leading from the assertion of a disjunction to the ignorance and exclusive inference can be summarized as follows:
- (26)
- Mary is patriotic or quixotic
speaker doesn’t know which
If the speaker had known that Mary is patriotic, she should have said so (by Quantity). Assuming that the speaker made the most informative relevant statement she could, the hearer can infer that the speaker doesn’t know that Mary is patriotic. Similar reasoning for the second disjunct. - (27)
- Mary is patriotic or quixotic
not both
If the speaker had known that Mary is patriotic and quixotic, she should not have used or, but and (by Quantity). Assuming that the speaker made the most informative relevant statement she could, the hearer can infer that the speaker doesn’t know that Mary is patriotic and quixotic. Assuming that the speaker is opinionated (either believes (A and B) or believes not (A and B)) one can conclude that Mary is not patriotic and quixotic.
The assumption in (27) that the speaker must be opinionated about the conjunctive statement is however problematic. Given that the use of or implicates that the speaker doesn’t know which, why should there be any pressure to think that the speaker would know both if it were true? A number of authors have indeed argued that Gricean implicatures are always epistemically modalized: so in (27) only the proposition that the speaker doesn’t know that Mary is patriotic and quixotic is derivable by Gricean means contra the predictions of the classical formalisation of Gricean implicatures of Gazdar (1979) (see Soames 1982: 521 and Horn 1989: 543). Many other attempts to formalization of (variations) of Gricean reasonings have been proposed in the literature, including Horn (1984) but also the more recent Sauerland (2004), van Rooij and Schulz (2004) and Franke (2011). All these formalizations assume a truth-functional analysis of disjunction and other connectives, as the baseline for the pragmatic reasoning. In what follows we will discuss recent developments in linguistic analysis of disjunction, including also challenges to a Gricean pragmatic view.
5. Inclusive and exclusive uses of or
While the Gricean argument in the previous section quite conclusively excludes that English or is ambiguous between an inclusive and an exclusive interpretation (contra, for example, Tarski 1939: 21[2], see also Barrett and Stenner 1971), recently some linguists have observed that some disjunctive constructions in languages other than English seem to force exclusive uses. Szabolcsi (2002, 2015) discusses the case of Hungarian vagy–vagy and Spector (2014) the case of French soit–soit. Russian ili–ili, Italian o–o, French ou –ou and German entweder–oder seem to behave in a similar fashion. These are all cases of fully-iterated disjunctions, with a disjunctive particle preceding each disjunct. Note however that not all fully-iterated disjunctive constructions are of these kinds, for example English either–or constructions are clearly not always exclusive (Nobody ate either rice or beans simply means nobody ate either), and iterated disjunctive constructions in Sinhala and Malayalam are not exclusive at all (see Szabolcsi 2015). Finally also Latin aut, which is often taken as a paradigmatic example of exclusive disjunction (e.g., Copi 1971),[3] has been shown to have inclusive uses (at least in its not iterated variant), for example Nemo timebat tribunos aut plebes (No one feared the magistrates or the mob) just means no one feared either. See Dik (1968: 274–276) and Jennings (1994: 239–251) for discussion and more examples.
To show that French soit-soit constructions tend to force exclusivity inferences, while French plain disjunction ou doesn’t, Spector discusses the following examples. The reply in both (28) and (29) contradicts the exclusive inference, but at the same time asserts that the first sentence is true. According to Spector, the fact that such a reply is infelicitous in (29) shows that the exclusive inference is obligatory in this case.
- (28)
-
- a.
- Marie ira au cinéma lundi ou mardi.
‘Marie will go to the movies on Monday or Tuesday.’ - b.
- Absolument! Et elle ira même à la fois lundi ET mardi.
‘Absolutely! She will even go both days.’
- (29)
-
- a.
- Marie ira au cinéma soit lundi soit mardi.
‘Marie will go to the movies SOIT on Monday SOIT on Tuesday.’ - b.
- # Absolument! Et elle ira même à la fois lundi ET mardi.
‘Absolutely! She will even go both days.’
It is important to notice at this point that logic textbook exclusive
disjunction, represented as
1 | 1 | 1 | 0 |
---|---|---|---|
1 | 0 | 1 | 1 |
0 | 1 | 1 | 1 |
0 | 0 | 0 | 0 |
First of all, it is well known that using
- (30)
-
- a.
- Tous mes étudiants étudient soit l’allemand
soit l’anglais.
‘Every student of mine studies SOIT German SOIT English.’ - b.
- Absolument! Et certains étudient même les deux.
‘Absolutely! And some even study both.’
On the other hand, Spector notices that the following would be deviant as a reply to (30a):
- (31)
- #Absolument! Et ils étudient même les deux.
‘Absolutely! And they even study both.’
Notice that (31) negates the exclusive (not both) implicature derived from (30a) by Gricean reasoning using (32) as a relevant alternative:
- (32)
- Tous mes étudiants étudient l’allemand et
l’anglais.
‘Every student of mine studies German and English.’
The generalization suggested by Spector is then that soit-soit and other iterated disjunctions obligatorily trigger Gricean exclusive inferences which are normally only optionally triggered by plain disjunction. Recent experiments reported in Nicolae et al (2024) however have challenged Spector's generalization showing that soit-soit and other iterated disjunctions in Russian, Greek and Romanian, although favouring exclusive interpretations, are not always interpreted exclusively even in unembedded position. It is an open question if Spector's account which involves an obligatorily association of these disjunctive forms with an exhaustivity operator (Fox 2007) can be maintained in view of these new findings. Note that the obligatorily triggered implicatures discussed in this literature are different from the Gricean conventional implicatures such as the one carried by but or therefore (see Grice 1975 and the entry on implicature). While the latter do not contribute to what is said and, similarly to presupposition, their not at issue contribution typically projects outside of the scope of logical operators (e.g., the contrastive effect produced by but does not change if we replace the quantifier in Everybody/Nobody is poor but happy), expressions triggering obligatory implicatures can contribute differently in the scope of different logical operators such as universal or negative quantifiers, and their contribution can be targeted by subsequent discourse moves as shown in example (29), and, therefore, is arguably part of what is said.
As mentioned above, besides favouring exclusive interpretations, these
iterated disjunctions are ungrammatical under negation. Let me
conclude this section with a note on the interaction between
disjunction and negation. Interactions between disjunction,
conjunction and negation in classical logic are regulated by the de
Morgan laws. English or seems to validate the second de
Morgan law
- (33)
- We didn’t close the door or the window.
Sentence
(33)
however has also a second reading, on which it means we did not close
the door or did not close the window, but I am not sure which. As
Szabolcsi (2002) observed, speakers in many languages including
Hungarian, Russian, Italian and French find that their counterpart of
(33)
only has this second reading. On this reading disjunction scopes over
negation, and so Szabolcsi proposes to treat disjunction words in
these languages as positive polarity items, i.e., roughly, expressions
that cannot be interpreted (anti-licensed) in the immediate scope of a
negation, unless the negation is itself in a negative or more
generally downward entailing (DE) context. A DE context is one in
which replacing a predicate with a stronger predicate preserves truth.
For example, the predicate being Italian is stronger than the
predicate being European because all Italians are also
Europeans. The antecedent of a conditional and the restriction of a
universal quantifier are both DE contexts just like the contexts
created by negation because of the following valid entailments: (i)
Antecedent of a conditional: If Sofia is European, she
qualifies for a reduction of the tuition fee
Spector introduces a distinction between local and global positive polarity items (PPIs) and argues that single disjunction in French and other languages are local PPIs (anti-licensed in the immediate scope of negation, unless certain constraints are met) as Szabolcsi had proposed, but the iterated disjunctive constructions discussed above are global PPIs (anti-licensed under the scope of negation, however distant the negation is, unless certain constraints are met). The following examples illustrate this distinction.
Locality of anti-licensing for local PPI ou [e.g., ou can be interpreted under the scope of a negation which is sufficiently far away]:
- (34)
- Je ne pense pas que Marie ait invité Pierre ou Julie
à dîner.
‘I don’t think that Marie invited Pierre or Julie for dinner.’ [understood as I don’t believe Pierre invited either one]
Long-distance anti-licensing for global PPI soit-soit [e.g., soit-soit cannot be interpreted under the scope of a negation even if far away]:
- (35)
- #Je ne pense pas que Jacques ait invité soit Anne soit Paul
à dîner. [Under a narrow-scope interpretation for
disjunction]
‘I don’t think that Jacques invited SOIT Anne SOIT Paul for dinner.’
6. Modal accounts of disjunction and free choice
We can think of disjunction as a means of entertaining different alternatives. If I say either it is raining or it is snowing, I normally convey that both alternatives are open options for me. Grice, as we just saw, argued against a semantic account of such effects, which he labeled as the non truth-functional ground of disjunction (Grice 1989). Zimmermann (2000), by contrast, proposes a modal analysis of linguistic disjunction which identifies the semantic contribution of or with precisely these epistemic effects (see also Geurts 2005 for a further development of this idea). On Zimmermann’s account linguistic disjunctions should be analyzed as conjunctive lists of epistemic possibilities:
- (36)
-
or…or ,
where is an epistemic possibility operator
Someone uttering a sentence of the form “
- (37)
- Where shall we go?
- a.
- London
or Berlin or Paris - b.
- London
or Berlin or Paris
While the terminal fall in the closed disjunction (37a) indicates that the speaker consider her list of options to be exhaustive, the terminal rise in (37b) conveys the opposite effect. On Zimmermann’s analysis is then the terminal fall which contributes exhaustivity and not or.
The main motivation behind Zimmermann’s modal analysis however
comes from phenomena of free choice. Sentences of the form “You
may
- (38)
[Free Choice Principle]
As Kamp (1973) pointed out, plainly making the Free Choice principle
valid, for example by adding it as an axiom, would not do because it
would allow us to derive
- (39)
-
- 1.
[assumption]- 2.
[from 1, by principle (38)]- 3.
[from 2, by free choice principle]
The step leading to 2 in (39) uses the following principle which holds in standard deontic logic:
- (40)
-
Intuitively, however, (40) seems invalid (You may go to the beach doesn’t seem to imply You may go to the beach or the cinema), while (38) seems to hold, in direct opposition to the principles of deontic logic. Von Wright (1968) labeled this the paradox of free choice permissions. Similar paradoxes arise also for imperatives (see Ross’ paradox, introduced in section 2), epistemic modals (Zimmermann 2000), and other modal constructions.
Various solutions have been proposed to the paradox of free choice (see Meyer 2020 for a recent overview). Many have argued that what we called the Free Choice Principle is merely a pragmatic inference and therefore the step leading to 3 in (39) is unjustified. One argument in favor of such a pragmatic account comes from the observation that free choice effects disappear in negative contexts. For example, No one is allowed to eat the cake or the ice-cream cannot merely mean that no one is allowed to eat the cake and the ice-cream, as would be expected if free choice effects were semantic entailments rather than pragmatic implicatures (Alonso-Ovalle 2006). Various ways of deriving free choice inferences as implicatures have been proposed in the neo-Gricean tradition (e.g., Gazdar 1979; Kratzer and Shimoyama 2002; Schulz 2005; Franke 2011; and Champollion, Alsop and Grosu 2019) and in the grammatical theory of scalar implicatures (e.g., Fox 2007, Bar–Lev and Fox 2020; and Del Pinal, Bassi and Sauerland 2024); see however Fusco 2014 for a critical discussion of implicature accounts to free choice.
Others have proposed modal systems where the step leading to 3 in (39) is justified while the step leading to 2 is no longer valid, e.g., Aloni 2007, which proposes a uniform account of free choice effects of disjunctions and indefinites under both modals and imperatives, and more recently Nygren (2022). Simons (2005) and Barker (2010) also proposed semantic accounts of free choice inferences, the latter crucially employing an analysis of or in terms of linear logic additive disjunction combined with a representation of strong permission using the deontic reduction strategy (as in Lokhorst 2006).
Finally Zimmermann (2000) reduces all free choice sentences to configurations where disjunction takes wide scope with respect to the modal:
- (41)
-
may or may may and may
By analyzing disjunctions as conjunctions of epistemic possibilities, the correct logical rendering of (41) seems to be the following:
- (42)
-
Zimmermann, however, actually derives only the weaker principle in
(43)
(under certain assumptions including his Authority principle).
- (43)
-
Semantic approaches to free choice like Zimmermann (2000), Aloni
(2007) or Simons (2010), however, typically predict too weak readings
for free choice sentences under negation. Goldstein (2019) and Aloni
(2022) recently proposed non-implicature accounts of free choice which
avoid this problem. In Goldstein (2019), both free choice and dual
prohibition (the inference from
iff for some such that and iff or
Aloni, following most scholars in the team semantics tradition, but
also Cresswell (2004) and Hawke and Steinert-Threlkeld (2018), adopts
Disjunction
Disjunction
7. Alternative-based accounts of disjunction
In the previous section, we saw that recent semantic work has argued
that disjunctions like “
(a) classical
(b) inquisitive
Figure 1.
7.1 Inquisitive semantics
In standard logic-based analyses of linguistic meanings, the
semantic content of a sentence
- (44)
-
iff or .
The interpretation of the connective is given in terms of support in
an information state (rather than truth in a world). For a disjunction
to be supported in a state, at least one of the disjuncts should be
supported, where an atomic sentence is supported in a state
From a logical point of view, inquisitive logic can be axiomatised by
expanding intuitionistic logic with the Kreisel-Putnam axiom scheme
From an algebraic perspective, as we saw in section 3, there is a long tradition in natural language semantics that analyzes disjunction words as expressing a join operator in a Boolean algebra, which, at the sentential level, delivers the least upper bound of the two disjuncts with respect to classic entailment. Recent work showed that alternative-based systems don’t need to abandon the elegant uniform algebraic perspective of the classical analysis: while classical entailment gives rise to a Boolean algebra, inquisitive entailment gives rise to a Heyting algebra, with meet, join, and relative pseudo-complement operators (Roelofsen 2013). Thus if we identify disjunction with the join operator in such a Heyting algebra, this automatically generates the desired cross-categorial, alternative-based notion (Ciardelli and Roelofsen 2015).
7.2 Examples of linguistic applications
A number of linguistic phenomena have been argued to justify an alternative-based analysis of disjunction. In the previous section we discussed the case of free choice. The remaining part of this section briefly reviews two additional cases: conditionals and questions.
7.2.1 Disjunction in the antecedent of a conditional
The first phenomenon concerns the interpretation of disjunction in the
antecedent of a counterfactual conditional. According to the classical
treatment due to Stalnaker (1968) and Lewis (1973), a counterfactual
- (45)
for indefinitely close
-worlds may be -worlds while all of the much closer -worlds are -worlds. However, the counterfactual if Thorpe or Wilson were to win the next General Election, Britain would prosper does seem to imply if Thorpe were to win the next General Election, Britain would prosper. (Fine 1975a: 453)
One possible reaction would be to abandon a Lewis/Stalnaker treatment of counterfactuals. But another solution is to adopt an alternative treatment of disjunction (Alonso-Ovalle 2006, 2009; van Rooij 2006). Indeed, if the disjunctive antecedent is taken to generate two alternatives and if verifying the counterfactual involves separately checking every alternative generated by the antecedent, the problem is avoided.
7.2.2 Disjunction in questions
An alternative analysis of disjunction further allows a perspicuous representation of the ambiguity of disjunctive questions like (46), between a polar reading (expected answers: yes/no) and an alternative reading (expected answers: coffee/tea) (e.g., von Stechow 1991 and Aloni, Égré, & Jager 2013, for the embedded case).
- (46)
- Do you want coffee or tea?
The alternative reading, which was problematic for standard analyses
of questions (Groenendijk and Stokhof 1984), can be easily represented
by adopting alternative/inquisitive disjunction (see
figure 1).
The polar interpretation naturally follows because the classical
notion of disjunction can be recovered from the alternative-based
interpretation by adding a closure operator such as the existential
propositional quantifier
In English, alternative and polar readings of questions can be distinguished by intonation or by using the contrastive marker either…or, the question Do you want either coffee or tea? only has a polar interpretation. Many languages including Mandarin Chinese, Finnish and Basque can use different disjunctive coordinators to disambiguate in these cases (Haspelmath 2007). These languages have two words for interrogative disjunction and standard disjunction. Interrogative disjunction (e.g., Basque ala) can only occur in interrogative clauses, where it forces an alternative reading, standard disjunction (e.g., Basque edo) can occur in both declarative and interrogative clauses, in the latter case it forces a polar interpretation. The following Basque example from Saltarelli (1988: 84) illustrates:
- (47)
- Te-a tea-ART ala or-INT kafe-a coffee-ART nahi want duzu? you.it ‘Do you want coffee or tea?’ (expected answers: coffee/tea)
- (48)
- Te-a tea-ART edo or-STA kafe-a coffee-ART nahi want duzu? you.it ‘Do you want either coffee or tea?’ (expected answers: yes/no)
The interaction between disjunctive words, questions and intonation is much more complex than has been exposed here, see Pruitt and Roelofsen (2013) for a description of the data and an illustration on how alternative-based systems can be employed to clarify these phenomena.
Suggestion for Further Reading: An excellent source on disjunction is Humberstone 2011, chapter 6.
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Acknowledgments
Many thanks to Floris Roelofsen, Luca Incurvati, Martin Stokhof and Ivano Ciardelli for comments on previous versions of this entry. I am further very grateful to an anonymous reviewer for many very useful suggestions and to the editors for their infinite patience. All mistakes are mine.