1. During his university years and later, Lange was very interested in gymnastics. He participated in tournaments, ran various organizations, and wrote about gymnastics. It should be emphasized that gymnastics in the German nineteenth-century context cannot be thought of merely as a hobby. Gymnastics organizations, indeed one can say the gymnastics movement as a whole, were part of an emphasis on physical fitness that was seen as going hand-in-hand with military preparedness in the face of French expansionism. It was part of a growing sense of nationalism and an unwillingness on the part of the growing middle classes to settle for the German Confederation created by the Congress of Vienna.

2. A Privatdozent is not part of the salaried staff of the University and is paid by student fees.

3. This at least is Ellissen’s view. Weinkauff claims that the inaugural lecture was on Herbart’s mathematical psychology (Weinkauff [1883] 1975, 24).

4. Helmholtz was a Professor of anatomy and physiology at the University of Bonn from 1855 to 1858.

5. This is probably to be explained by the fact that Marx and Engels had just been through what they regarded as a bad experience in trying to influence the workers’ movement in Germany from afar by publishing in German newspapers. They felt that they had been mislead by the editor of the Social-Demokrat. Lange knew this but thought that their break with the Social-Demokrat actually opened up the possibility for new cooperation. Engel rejected the proposal politely with an allusion to recent problems and left the door for future cooperation open (Lange 1958, 73, 78–79; this includes Engels’ letter). Engels was acting under Marx’s instructions: “Lange: not to be directly rebuffed.… As he rightly realizes himself, after our recent experience we would have to hold back for the present from making contributions to any German paper” (Marx and Engels 1975, 42: 119). See also Hundt 1965, 698–99.

6. Lange (1866a, 21) wrote:

It is therefore [for Kant] always the regard of the individual for the whole that determines morality. But that this voice, which commands us to attend to the interests of others, to the interests of a whole, is in fact by no means ready-formed a priori in man — that it develops in him rather through natural means, through his intercourse with the outside world — should be immediately apparent. And here Adam Smith’s derivation from sympathy, though even for its time very inadequately executed, remains to this day still the most suitable attempt at a natural and rational foundation.

7. The reason why Lange engages extensively with the British tradition could also be understood as an expression of his argumentative style, namely, his tendency to treat British philosophers as articulating the British outlook, which — with its increased focus on experience — has a sobering effect on the German cast of mind, which, with its focus on ideals, tends to reinforce class prejudices.

8. Within capitalism, the struggle for existence for the working class becomes a struggle for wages.

9. Lange concluded that the solution to the problem of what to do about the working class, the “Arbeiterfrage”—literally the “worker question”—as it was called, must come from the workers themselves. This required political organization of workers into a united front against the bourgeoisie (Irmer 1975, 2).

10. Lange believes that, “in most cases,” taxing inheritance is not only in the interest of the public but even in the interest of the beneficiaries themselves (Lange 1866a, 94). While he does not seem opposed to abolishing inheritance altogether, he believes that such abolition must be approached gradually, through progressive taxation.

11. It is important to note, given the political context in which Lange was writing, that he did not seem to think that some revolutionary act would bring us suddenly closer to such improved conditions of existence. He saw such development as a slow one. Simply changing the legal property relations or the official structure of the state would not be sufficient, he argued. What was required in addition to changes in the structure of the state and the legal system were fundamental changes in the way people think, which will always take time. The reform of the state and laws provides the preconditions for this change in consciousness, but does not bring about this change immediately. Lange was careful not to deny that the kind of revolution some socialists and communists supported could bring us closer to the goal. But any such revolution would be merely one step in a long process that will involve both progress and regress (Lange 1894a, 249–251).

12. Lange mentions the importance of teaching natural sciences and a sense for the public good (1866a, 77).

13. According to Lange, “the view that the state has nothing to do with the matter” is just as mistaken (Lange 1894a, 250). Lange criticizes the kind of self-help approach that some of the liberal middle class, in particular Franz Hermann Schulze-Delitzsch, famously pushed. Schulze-Delitzsch believed that the goals of the liberal bourgeoisie and the working class did not have to be thought of as in conflict. The problems facing the working class could be dealt with within the existing capitalist mode of production. The working class, to put it crudely, could, through a series of consumer, credit, and production cooperatives, educate itself and save enough money to compete with capitalists on their own terms. Lange thought this position was completely unrealistic, and that those who pushed it failed to actually listen to the workers themselves. He criticized the paternalistic attitude of these liberal reformers and mocked their inability to even understand the dialects spoken by many of the workers.

14. The improvement of living conditions to a sufficient level requires organizing the working class so that they can demand better wages and a decrease in the concentration of capital. This may be possible while maintaining private property in the means of production, but, if not, we should aim for communism, or whatever other system promises success, including various forms of mixed economies. We will only learn slowly through experience what the best system is (Lange 1866a, 113–114; Lange 1894a, 212–262).

15. According to Marx, we are not only sensuous beings of the natural world, but equally part of a social world in which we encounter norms of action that precede our existence and that we accept largely without reflection. Yet precisely because we presuppose these norms as given and self-evident, it is, in Marx’s view, the task of philosophy to show that “the religious disposition” (but also the moral, legal, and political) “is a social product” that confronts and determines us — despite its human origin — in materialized form (Marx 1969, 5ff).

16. For instance, Cohen argues that inheritance laws in capitalist societies are based on the misleading assumption that a “person’s will could be materialized” in an object (Cohen 1981/1904, 608–609). “Capital,” on the other hand, “no longer seems to be a mere thing; it becomes a person because it acts like persons” (Cohen 1981/1904, 609). Concerning the concept of labor, Cohen argues that the employer would gain, for a certain amount of time, “ownership” over the worker (Cohen 1981/1904, 605).

17. Some of the material below is drawn from Hussain 2004.