Godfrey of Fontaines

First published Fri Aug 17, 2001; substantive revision Fri Sep 18, 2026

Godfrey of Fontaines was one of the major philosopher-theologians to serve as Regent Master (a Master in active service) at the University of Paris in the final quarter of the thirteenth century, along with Henry of Ghent and Giles of Rome, among others. After completing philosophical studies in the Faculty of Arts and beginning to study theology probably by August, 1274, he became Regent Master in Theology in 1285 and retained this position until 1303/1304. He was positively influenced by Thomas Aquinas, but differed with him on various major points, and also seems to have been influenced by the Arts Master Siger of Brabant. His might well be described as a metaphysics of act and potency, since he often turns to this in seeking to resolve metaphysical problems such as, for instance, the relationship between essence and existence and between possible and actual being, the distinction between substance and accidents and between the soul and its powers, the causes of intellection and volition, or the nature of prime matter and its relationship to substantial form. Overall his philosophical thought and especially his metaphysics is somewhat more Aristotelian and less influenced by Neoplatonism than that of many of his contemporaries, including Aquinas. In Godfrey’s moral psychology, the intellect is preeminent over the will; this preeminence has important implications for his ethics. In his political thought, the notion of the common good plays a central role.

1. Life and Writings

Godfrey of Fontaines was born in present-day Belgium in the principality of Liège, very likely at the château of the noble family of which he was a member, at Fontaines-les-Hozémont, probably shortly before 1250. This approximate date can be inferred from the fact that he conducted his first quodlibetal dispute as a Master of Theology at Paris in 1285 and that one could not become a Master in this faculty before reaching the age of 35. While nothing is known with certainty about his life prior to his arrival at Paris, he must have pursued philosophical studies there in the Faculty of Arts in the early 1270s. University statutes required one to spend at least eight years studying theology before becoming a Master, and it is also known that Godfrey was inscribed at the Sorbonne before August 15, 1274. Hence his theological studies should have begun by that date (De Wulf 1904, 3–16; Wippel 1981, xv–xviii; for the most comprehensive overview of his life and works, see Aiello 2026).

Godfrey was evidently a great lover of books, and among the surviving 37 manuscripts he left to the Sorbonne is a valuable “Student Notebook” (Paris, BnF lat. 16297) which he himself compiled during his student days at Paris and into which he entered many writings in his own hand. While it was not completed by 1274 or earlier, as was previously proposed, the most recent research indicates that Godfrey composed it almost entirely between the end of 1276 and 1278, with the exception of the final small portion copied at the earliest between 1278–1280 and at the latest between 1280–1281 (Aiello-Wielockx 2008, 167). It reflects his interests in the 1270s during his time as a theology student at Paris and includes works by Thomas Aquinas, Siger of Brabant, Boethius of Dacia, other anonymous Questions on various works of Aristotle which are clearly by some Master(s) of Arts of the time, still others by Giles of Rome, some extracts from Albert the Great and from Henry of Ghent, as well as other purely theological writings (Duin 1959; Wippel 2001, 360–7; and Aiello-Wielockx 2008, an exhaustive study). An anonymous set of Questions on Books I–II of Aristotle’s De anima contained in this same Student Notebook has recently been assigned to Boethius of Dacia and edited (Wielockx 2009). Godfrey’s interest in the writings of radical Aristotelian Arts Masters at Paris in the 1260s and 1270s is also indicated by other works of Arts Masters included in additional manuscripts in his library (BnF lat. 15819, 16096). Also noteworthy is the inclusion in his Student Notebook of one of the oldest and most reliable copies of Aquinas’s controversial De aeternitate mundi, which itself dates probably from 1271. And Godfrey’s interest in and reaction to the thought of important contemporary members of the Theology Faculty at Paris, such as Henry of Ghent and Giles of Rome, is evident from the contents of various manuscripts containing writings by them in his personal library (Wielockx 2014).

Godfrey continued to teach as a Master of Theology at the University until ca. 1303/1304 when he conducted his fifteenth and last Quodlibetal Disputation, and he was in Paris for a meeting at the Sorbonne in February 1304. He may have been away from Paris for some more extended periods after completing Quodlibet XIV ca. 1298–1299. It is known that he maintained close connections with Liège during his career at Paris and, indeed, that he served as Canon of Liège. He also served as Provost of St. Severin at Cologne and as Canon of Tournai, although some doubt has been raised about the latter point (Field 2009, 138, n. 11). It has also been reported that he was elected Bishop of Tournai in 1300 but renounced his rights to the episcopal see when the election was contested. While some question about the accuracy of this has also been raised (Field, ibid.), it is certain that he was involved in negotiating a settlement for the disputed election and that this required him to travel to Rome to present the case to the Roman Curia. Godfrey died on October 29, according to the necrology of the Sorbonne, but we do not know the year with certainty. 1306 is the last year for which records indicate that Godfrey was still alive.

Godfrey selected the quodlibetal disputation as his major vehicle for publication. These solemn disputations were conducted twice during the academic year, during Advent and Lent (the liturgical seasons before Christmas and before Easter). They were open to all members of the learned public and any question could be posed to the presiding Master by anyone in attendance. During the first day’s disputation, preliminary answers would be given to these many and disparate questions. On the following day or at least on some following day, the Master, having in the meantime imposed some logical organizing plan upon the various questions, would return for another session where he would present his definitive response or “determination” for each of them. Subsequently he would prepare this version for publication and, when it was completed, would submit it to the University Bookseller. Masters were not required to conduct these open disputations and, since they were regarded as onerous, not all did. Godfrey’s 15 Quodlibets have all been edited, although the first four remain only as reportationes, that is, copies taken down by an auditor. For several of the Quaestiones of the first four Quodlibets we only have the opening arguments, not the response. For the response, the reportator refers the reader to the liber magistri, Godfrey’s personal notebook. Unfortunately, it has not come down to us. Brief versions (abbreviationes) of Quodlibets III and IV have also been edited. Since medieval times, there has been some difficulty about the literary form of Quodlibet XIV concerning whether it really is a Quodlibet or some other kind of Disputed Question. Wippel (2006) concludes it is more probable that it is indeed a Quodlibet, but one that is unique in terms of its organizing plan and structure. As a Master of Theology, Godfrey also conducted ordinary Disputed Questions, some of which have been preserved (for a list of these and for their dating, see Aiello 2026, 52–8).

2. Metaphysics

2.1 Subject of Metaphysics

Godfrey was surely familiar with the controversy concerning whether one should, with Avicenna, identify being as being as the subject of metaphysics on account of its nonparticular and therefore universal character, or rather, with Averroes, identify its subject as the highest kind of being, the divine. On this issue, Godfrey clearly agrees with Avicenna, even though he devotes little explicit attention to the controversy itself. Thus in Quodlibet X, q. 11 he holds that being as being is the object (or subject) of metaphysics (PB 4.349) and in Quodlibet VI, q. 6 that the concept of being is first and simplest because it enters into every other concept (PB 3.137). Therefore it is also the most general concept or, one may say, transcendental. At times Godfrey also describes the object of the intellect as being as being (Quodlibet II, q. 8). He denies that God is the subject of metaphysics, even though God is the first and primary being and must be studied within metaphysics (Quodlibet I, q. 5). He distinguishes a metaphysical study of God, which he says may be described as a kind of theology, from the theology that is based on Sacred Scripture. Theology in this sense does not have being as being as its subject, but God himself (Quodlibet IX, q. 20; Wippel 1981, 3–15; Pickavé 2026, 109–14).

2.2 Division of Being

In opposition to Henry of Ghent’s division of real being into essential being (esse essentiae) and existential being (esse existentiae), Godfrey proposes his own division in Quodlibet VIII, q. 3. Being (esse) may be divided into being in the mind (“cognitive” being), which is a lesser or diminished being, and real being, that is, being outside the mind or knower. Real being is subdivided into real being in potency and real being in act. A thing possesses real being in potency insofar as it has being by reason of its cause or causes. It has real being in act insofar as it is realized in its own nature in completed or perfected form. A thing may have real being in potency either by reason of its intrinsic cause (e.g., if matter preexists that may enter into the thing’s constitution) or by reason of an extrinsic cause (e.g., if an agent preexists that can produce it). Godfrey illustrates this with the example of a rose that does not yet actually exist. Prior to the creation of the world and hence of matter, it possessed real being in potency only by reason of God, its extrinsic cause. After creation, it possessed real being in potency by reason of preexisting matter as well, an intrinsic cause. And now it may also possess real potential being by reason of some created extrinsic cause (or causes). Both before and after the world’s creation, it enjoys cognitive being insofar as it was and is known by the divine mind (PB 4.38–40; Wippel 1981, 15–17).

2.3 Act-Potency Axiom and Self-Motion

A distinctive trait of Godfrey’s metaphysics with important repercussions for his theory of cognition and his moral psychology is the act-potency axiom: “nothing can be in act and in potency at the same time and in the same respect” (as formulated in Pickavé 2026; see ibid. and Wippel 1973 for discussion). For Godfrey, the act-potency axiom entails the impossibility of a certain kind of self-motion: per se self-motion, that is, something reducing itself from having a certain perfection in potency to possessing it in actuality. The thing would then be in act and in potency at the same time and in the same respect (e.g., Quodlibet VI, q. 7, PB 3.151–3). Godfrey’s adversaries posit such a kind of self-motion in the will; most insistently Henry of Ghent, according to whom the will reduces itself from potentially willing X to actually willing X (Hoffmann 2021, 75–9). Throughout his works, Godfrey denies that any exception can be made to the act-potency axiom, rejecting the positions of Henry of Ghent (especially in Quodlibet VI, q. 7), John of Morrovalle (ibid.), Giles of Rome (Quodlibet VIII, q. 16), James of Viterbo (Quodlibet XIII, q. 3), and Gonsalvus of Spain (Quodlibet XV, q. 4). The will cannot reduce itself from potency to act, that is, it cannot cause its own acts of volition by efficient causation (see also below, section 5.1). Against his adversaries, Godfrey insists that the act-potency axiom holds no less for spiritual beings such as the will than for material things (Quodlibet VIII, q. 2, PB 4.19–23; Quodlibet XV, q. 4, PB 14.22).

The act-potency axiom does not prohibit all types of self-motion. Animals move themselves, for they have distinct parts of which some are moving, others moved. But things in which such heterogenous parts are not found cannot move themselves, for example stones (Quodlibet VI, q. 7, PB 3.155–7) and the will (ibid., 152). While per se self-motion is impossible (ibid., 157–8), Godfrey allows for per accidens self-motion, even of uncomposed or homogeneous things. The soul, by moving the body, moves itself per accidens (Quodlibet VII, q. 6, PB 3.345–6); the will moves the intellect to deliberate about which means to an end is to be chosen and then it is moved in accordance with the result of deliberation, and so it moves itself not directly and per se, but indirectly (Quodlibet X, q. 13, PB 4.375–6; cf. Quodlibet VIII, q. 16, PB 4.156 and Quodlibet XV, q. 4, PB 14.28–9).

2.4. Analogy of Being

In describing being as being (ens secundum quod ens) as the object of the intellect in Quodlibet II, q. 8, Godfrey also states that being is taken analogically and not univocally. It is affirmed first and foremost of substance, especially first substance, and of everything else as related to substance. Hence both substance and accident are included under this analogous notion of being and this single object of the intellect (PB 2.135–6; Wippel 1981, 19–24). In Quodlibet III, q. 1, Godfrey attempts to establish the analogical character of being by arguing at some length that being cannot be either univocal or purely equivocal. Central to his rejection of univocity of being is his denial that it is a supreme genus, for it must apply not only to the generic and specific aspects in which different things share, but also to the differences, including the individual differences between them (PB 2.162–3). In Quodlibet XV, q. 3, while responding to an objection perhaps taken from Meister Eckhart’s Parisian Disputed Question 1, he maintains that, even if being is applied to accidents only insofar as they are related to substance in some way, this does not mean that being is not formally, that is, intrinsically present in accidents. So, too, when being is applied to creatures viewed as effects and to God as their cause, it applies intrinsically to God. There is an analogy and proportion in reality between these different instantiations of being, and, corresponding to this, there is analogy in meaning as well. It is this that is grasped by the analogous concept of being (PB 14.13, 18–20; Wippel 2001, 381–2).

2.5. Transcendentals

In Quodlibet III, q. 1, Godfrey identifies the one, the true, and the good as properties of being that are really identical and convertible with it, and hence as transcendental characteristics of being. These properties are not really distinct from being itself (PB 2.163–4). In Quodlibet VI, q. 16, he distinguishes between the kind of unity that serves as a principle for number and is based on discrete quantity (numerical unity in the strict sense) and the kind of unity that is convertible with being. While the former kind of unity is restricted to corporeal being, the latter applies to every subsisting substance and to every accident that exists in such a substance. Hence it alone is transcendental (PB 3.256–8). Regarding the true, in Quodlibet VI, q. 6, Godfrey indicates that truth adds nothing real to being but only a (conceptual) relationship to mind or intellect. To assign this kind of truth to a thing is simply to acknowledge that it can be grasped by intellect or that it is intelligible. Consequently, Godfrey holds that truth is present in being virtually insofar as it has the capacity (virtus) to produce truth in the intellect. But he favors the view that, when taken formally, truth resides in the intellect (PB 3.137–41; Wippel 1981, 25–34). Hence here he is recognizing the distinction later referred to as that between ontological truth and logical truth.

2.6. Essence and Existence

Already during Godfrey’s student days in Arts and in Theology at Paris there was considerable discussion concerning the relationship between essence and existence in finite or created beings. Closely associated with the metaphysical thought of Aquinas was the view that in all finite beings there is a real (i.e., not merely conceptual or mind-dependent) distinction, and hence a composition, of an essence principle and an existence principle or act of existing (esse). Already in the 1270s, Giles of Rome was developing his own theory of real distinction between essence and existence, and he was soon engaged in ongoing controversy with Henry of Ghent. At times, Giles referred to essence and existence as distinct “things” (res) and, while he denied that either could exist in separation from the other or that existence is an essence, his terminology left its mark on the theory and opened it to such misinterpretations: for it invited critics to view existence or the act of being as an entity rather than as a principle of an existing entity, as Aquinas had envisioned it. While Henry of Ghent rejected any real distinction between essence and existence, he defended something more than a merely conceptual distinction between them, namely a new and third type that would fall between the real distinction and the merely conceptual distinction, which he called an “intentional distinction” (Wippel 1981, 40–5; König-Pralong 2005, 67–91).

Godfrey briefly refers to this issue in Quodlibet II, q. 2, while attempting to determine whether the essence of a creature is indifferent to existence and nonexistence. He comments that either essence is really identical with existence and differs from it (1) only conceptually or (2) intentionally, or else (3) existence is a distinct thing, that is, the act of the essence and really distinct from it (PB 2.60). In Quodlibet IV, q. 2, he was asked to determine whether to hold that predicamental things—that is, things considered in their genus or species—are eternal by reason of their quiddity (or essence) is also to hold that the world is eternal. In preparing his response, he presents in greater detail these three different views on the relationship between essence and existence (esse). According to some, they are really distinct from one another and enter into real composition with one another. But one is not separable from the other so as to be able to exist apart from it. Consequently, if a thing lacks or loses its existential being, it also lacks or loses its essential being. According to a second view, they are really identical but differ intentionally. Hence, when a thing loses its existential being, its essence cannot be said to exist; but it does retain its true predicamental or essential being (esse essentiae). Finally, a third position, which Godfrey himself embraces, maintains that they are really identical and differ only conceptually. They do not enter into composition with one another. Therefore, to the extent that something enjoys essential being, to that same degree it enjoys actual existence. And, adds Godfrey, whatever is understood of one is also understood of the other (PB 2.235).

In Quodlibet III, q. 1, dating from 1286, Godfrey considers the argumentation offered for each of these positions. First, he presents the theory that professes the real distinction between essence and existence in language that reflects the terminology of Giles of Rome. Thus he refers to existence both as “something” (aliquid) and as a “thing” (res) that is added to essence. He then presents a number of arguments in support of this view which seem to be taken from Giles, especially from his Quaestiones disputatae de esse et essentia, q. 11. One of these is reminiscent of the first part of Aquinas’s much discussed reasoning in De ente et essentia, ch. 4, which begins from the fact that one can understand what something is without knowing whether it actually exists. However, Giles’s presentation (and Godfrey’s repetition) of the argument makes a stronger claim. One can understand what something is and also know that it does not exist. But because nothing can be understood with the opposite of itself, essence and existence must be really distinct. After presenting a series of arguments against this theory and refuting the arguments he had initially offered in support of it, Godfrey resolutely rejects any real distinction between essence and existence. For him, they are identical and differ only in the way they signify, just as the concrete noun “a being” (ens), the abstract noun “essence” (essentia), and the verb “to be” or “to exist” (esse) differ in their mode of signifying, but designate one and the same reality (PB 3.304 [brief version]; Wippel 1981, 45–66).

In presenting Henry’s theory of intentional distinction, Godfrey traces this back in large measure to what he regards as an incorrect interpretation of Avicenna’s notion of nature or essence when it is considered simply in itself or “absolutely” rather than as existing in the mind or in an individual entity. As Godfrey explains in his later Quodlibet VIII, q. 3, according to Henry’s position, real being is divided into essential being (esse essentiae) and existential being (esse existentiae). A thing possesses essential being from eternity insofar as it corresponds to its appropriate exemplar idea within the divine intellect. Because of this, it is a true or real quiddity or essence from eternity and falls into its appropriate predicament (that is, category) even though it is not an actual existent. Existing entities receive actual existence only in the course of time when the divine will intervenes to cause this. Within an actually existing being, therefore, its essence and existence are not really distinct. But Henry denies that they are identical. They are “intentionally” distinct (Wippel 1981, 67–79; Marrone 2001, 39–52; Porro 1996, 211–53). Godfrey rejects Henry’s new and intermediary kind of distinction out of hand. A distinction must either be real or purely conceptual. Accordingly, in Quodlibet III, q. 1, he argues at length against Henry’s application of the intentional distinction to essence and existence (Wippel 1981, 85–8).

As already noted, for Godfrey essence and existence are really identical and differ only conceptually. Whatever is true of essence is true of existence, and vice versa. It is not necessary to posit two really distinct or two intentionally distinct principles to account for the fact that one may be aware of something as a possible existent when it does not actually exist. It is enough to distinguish between potential being and actual being. If something is in potency in terms of its essence, it is in potency in terms of its existence. And if it is actual in terms of its essence, it is actual in terms of its existence.

Godfrey proposes a different kind of act-potency “composition” in order to address an argument in support of real distinction between essence and existence. If, as Aquinas, Giles, and Godfrey all hold, the angels of Christianity are purely spiritual and not composed of (spiritual) matter and form, then it seems that they must be composed of essence and existence; otherwise they would be perfectly simple and equal to God. Godfrey responds that one and the same being, even if purely spiritual, may be regarded as actual insofar as it exists, but as potential insofar as it falls short of the actuality enjoyed by a higher being and, above all, by the First Being, God. He quotes Proposition 2 from Proclus’s Elementatio theologica: “What participates in the One is both One and not-One.” As Godfrey reads this, anything that is different from the One can fall short of the One only by approaching (accessus) the not-one. Hence it is simply by reason of the fact that such a being recedes from the One that it is not the One itself. In this way, more perfect beings such as angels are distinct from the One, or God, without being composed either of matter and form or of essence and existence. Nonetheless, actuality and potentiality are present in them because they possess a certain intermediary nature and hence are likened or “assimilated” to something higher and more actual, and to something lower and more potential. Therefore they are “composed” of potency and act, not really, but conceptually. This composition is not merely fictional. It applies to such entities by their being related to something higher and to something lower (Quodlibet III, q. 1, q. 3; Quodlibet VII, q. 7; Wippel 1981, 90–7; König-Pralong 2005, 118–24).

Godfrey’s library contains two likely sources for this theory, first a rudimentary version found in the abbreviated text of Siger of Brabant’s Quaestiones in Metaphysicam included in Godfrey’s Student Notebook, and second, an anonymous set of questions contained in the manuscript Paris, BnF. lat. 16096. While Godfrey literally borrows certain parts of his theory from the second text, he does not follow this anonymous radical Aristotelian Arts Master when he goes on to argue that separate entities do not depend upon God as their efficient cause, but only as their final cause (Wippel 1984a, 231–44).

2.7 Eternity of the World

Together with his Christian contemporaries, Godfrey believed that the world began to be. But it was much debated whether natural reason can prove this, or whether it must be held solely on the grounds of religious faith. Probably best known for holding that the world’s beginning in time cannot be demonstrated was Aquinas, who in his De aeternitate mundi went a step beyond his earlier writings and maintained not only this but also that an eternally created world is possible (Wippel 1984b, 203–14). Bonaventure had presented a series of arguments to prove that the world began to be, and many others strongly defended this position, including Henry of Ghent (Dales 1990; Wippel 1981, 153–8). Thus it is not surprising that in his Quodlibet II, q. 3 of Lent, 1286, Godfrey was asked to determine whether the world or any creature could be or exist from eternity.

Godfrey develops his position in conscious opposition to Henry of Ghent and with a considerable but unacknowledged dependency on Aquinas’s De aeternitate mundi, which, as noted above, was contained in his Student Notebook. But after he has shown, with Aquinas, that there is no contradiction in holding that something can be created and still not have begun to be, Godfrey considers certain objections against this position. One of these objections clearly gives him pause. If the world had been created from eternity, on every given day extending backward into a beginningless past God could have created some material object such as a stone. But if that had happened, an actual infinity of stones would now exist and God could unite all of them into one infinite body. But an infinite body is an impossibility, and so too is an infinity of simultaneously existing finite bodies and, therefore, so also is an eternally created world (PB 2.68–9, 76; Wippel 1981, 160–3).

Godfrey comments that this objection can also be formulated more forcefully in terms of human souls, that is, by arguing that there would be an actual infinity of immortal human souls if the world had been populated from eternity by human beings. Aquinas had considered this kind of objection in his De aeternitate mundi and had noted that it has not yet been demonstrated that God could not produce an actual infinity of spiritual beings. Godfrey does not adopt this solution, presumably because he is convinced that an actual infinity of entities, whether spiritual or material, is impossible. Instead, he proposes as a possible alternative an eternally populated world involving the repeated transmigration of a finite number of souls to ever new bodies so as to animate an infinite number of bodies. For Godfrey, this would be possible if the souls were ordered only to natural perfection. But because human beings, for whom this world seems to be primarily intended, are destined to enjoy supernatural, eternal beatitude in soul and body, Godfrey grants that it may be argued with probability that this world could not have been created from eternity under the present dispensation by God’s ordained power. But, he also remarks, this does not prove that no creature or no world could have been eternally created. He concludes that it cannot be demonstrated either that an eternal world is not possible, or that it is possible. Either side may be regarded as plausible, and neither is to be rejected as theologically erroneous (PB 2.79–80; Wippel 1981, 167–8).

2.8 Substance and Accidents

In Quodlibet XIV, q. 5, Godfrey contrasts mental being with extramental being and then divides the latter into being per se and being per accidens. Being per se is divided into substance and the nine genera of accidents. The latter may be regarded as real modes of substance or of being in the unqualified sense (ens simpliciter). As Godfrey indicates elsewhere, a substance enjoys a separate being or exists in itself, while it is of the nature of an accident to be ordered to and to exist in something else. An accident is not so much a being as “of a being” (PB 5.427). For practical purposes, Godfrey accepts the number of predicaments as ten, but indicates that determination of their precise number is a matter of probability rather than certainty (Wippel 1981, 174–5). For Godfrey, substance and accident are related as potency and act, since substance serves as a subject for its accidents. Because of this, he denies that any substance can be the efficient cause of the accidents that inhere in it, for it would then be in act with respect to them (as their efficient cause) and in potency (as receiving them) at one and the same time. In this context he affirms again that nothing can be in act and in potency at one and the same time with respect to the same thing, for this would be to assign being and nonbeing to it simultaneously (Wippel 1981, 176–84). He also holds against many of his contemporaries that the powers of the soul are really distinct from the essence of the soul and from one another (ibid., 202–7).

In Quodlibet VII, q. 5, Godfrey was asked whether a supposit (a concrete existing subject) adds any reality (res) to essence or nature. He maintains that in terms of their primary meaning or denotation, supposit and nature are really one and the same, but in terms of its connotation, the term ‘supposit’ signifies something more than does the term ‘nature’: namely, those accidents without which a supposit would not exist in the concrete order, and the exclusion of dependence upon another subject or center of existence. This has important implications for his theological discussion of the union of human nature and a divine person in Christ according to Christian faith (Wippel 1981, 227–46; Cross 2002, 69–70, 114–19, 290–5).

An unusual theory to account for the increase or decrease in the intensity of an accidental quality, such as the whiteness of an object or charity in the human soul, was attributed to Godfrey by medieval critics of this theory such as John Duns Scotus and Walter Burley a few years later (ca. 1323) as well as many others. According to this theory, when such a quality increases or decreases in intensity, the previous quality is completely destroyed and replaced by a newly generated and numerically distinct quality. There is a textual problem concerning Godfrey’s personal position because his explicit discussion of this problem in his Disputed Question 18 is incomplete in the two known surviving manuscripts that contain it. Modern scholars are divided about the accuracy of the attribution of this view to Godfrey. Anneliese Maier (2nd ed., 1951, 3rd rev. ed., 1968) and John Wippel (1979) challenged the reliability of this attribution. Edith Dudley Sylla (1981) argued that Godfrey’s explanation of changes in the quantity of the Eucharistic species after transubstantiation indicated that he defended a similar “succession theory” to account for changes in quantity; she suggested that this may have led Scotus to attribute to him the succession theory in changes of qualities. More recently, in two coauthored studies Jean Celeyrette and Jean-Luc Solère (2002, 2009) argue that Godfrey did indeed defend the succession theory in accounting for increases or decreases in qualities. Stephen Dumont (2009) draws upon discussions by Scotus, Burley, and many other medieval writers to support this claim as well. It seems possible that Godfrey defended such a position, but we lack a text in which he explicitly and clearly defends it. If one day the complete text of his Disputed Question 18 is found in some manuscript, the historical issue can be definitively resolved. Meanwhile, healthy skepticism is recommended; even one of the texts cited by Dumont, taken from Bernard of Auvergne, a known critic of Godfrey’s views on many points, expresses doubt concerning whether Godfrey really held this position and rejects it if indeed he did, but not if Godfrey was referring to different degrees of a quality rather than to numerically distinct qualities themselves in such changes (Dumont 2009, 80, 118).

2.9 Prime Matter and Celestial Matter

Godfrey defends the matter–form composition of corporeal beings but rejects any kind of spiritual matter and therefore any matter–form composition of spiritual entities, which thinkers like Bonaventure and Gonsalvus of Spain had affirmed (Wippel 2012). He also opposes the strong tendency within the Franciscan tradition, also promoted by Henry of Ghent, to assign some minimum degree of actuality to prime matter. According to Godfrey, prime matter is pure potentiality and can never be kept in existence without some substantial form, not even by God. Prime matter and substantial form are directly related to one another as potency principle and act principle. Neither is a being in its own right, but both are principles of one and the same composite entity (Quodlibet XIV, q. 5, PB 5.404–5).

Godfrey rejects Aquinas’s theory that sublunar prime matter and celestial matter are essentially different, the first being in potency to receive all material forms and the second only to receive the celestial form it actually has. This distinction allowed Aquinas to account for the incorruptibility of celestial bodies (Summa theologiae I, q. 66, a. 2). Instead, to explain their incorruptibility, Godfrey reluctantly follows Averroes in holding that celestial bodies are immaterial (Quodlibet IX, q. 7, PB 4.232–3; Donati 2026).

2.10 Unicity vs. Plurality of Substantial Form

Heatedly debated in the 1270s and 1280s both at Paris and Oxford was the question concerning whether there is one or more than one substantial form in one substance, and especially in a human being. Godfrey devotes considerable attention to this issue, especially in Quodlibet II of Lent, 1286 and then again in Quodlibet III of Advent, 1286. These dates are significant, because alleged theological difficulties with the theory of unicity of substantial form as advanced by Aquinas and others had led to several prohibitions and condemnations of this theory: one by the Archbishop of Canterbury, Robert Kilwardby, O.P. on March 18, 1277, a reissuing of this by his successor in the episcopal see, John Pecham, O.F.M. in 1284, and finally a new and resounding condemnation by Pecham on April 30, 1286.

In Quodlibet II, q. 7, Godfrey considers three theories that defend plurality of forms in all material substances, or at least duality of substantial forms in human beings (Henry of Ghent). Godfrey severely criticizes all three theories. Most fundamental among his many arguments against them is his conviction that a substantial form confers substantial being upon a composite substance. Therefore, the presence of more than one substantial form in such a being would undermine its substantial unity. Already in this discussion, Godfrey addresses alleged theological issues raised against unicity of substantial form, especially one concerning the continuing numerical identity of Christ’s body during the period between his death on Good Friday and his resurrection on Easter Sunday. At this point, Godfrey’s philosophical preference is for unicity of form in all material entities, including humans. He regards theories that defend plurality of forms in all material substances as more improbable and Henry’s theory of duality of forms in human beings as less improbable. He maintains that the theological question remains open to a defense either of unicity or of plurality of substantial forms.

In Quodlibet III, q. 5, after the condemnation by Pecham of April, 1286, Godfrey examines the theological aspects of this issue in detail. Again, he insists on one’s freedom, theologically speaking, to defend either unicity or plurality of forms in human beings, especially at Paris, but does not commit himself definitively to either side (PB 2.197–211). In sum, when he is primarily concerned with the philosophical issues involved, he favors unicity of substantial form in all material substances. When discussing the theological issues, he is more hesitant and, without embracing either side in any definitive way, continues to argue for one’s freedom to defend either side, pending some future decision by the Church (Wippel 1981, 321–47).

2.11 Principle of Individuation

Together with many of his contemporaries, Godfrey attempts to identify the principle within material entities that accounts for their being multiplied numerically within a species. In discussing this topic, he returns to the distinction he had drawn in Quodlibet VI, q. 16 between the kind of unity that serves as a principle of number and is based on discrete quantity and the kind that is convertible with being, that is, transcendental unity. Because the substantial form is the determining principle within a corporeal entity and makes its essence capable of being defined, Godfrey holds that it is by reason of its form that such a substance enjoys transcendental unity.

Nonetheless, in Quodlibet VII, q. 5, he comments that if different individuals within the same species share in the same specific nature, that nature cannot itself serve as the principle that renders them numerically distinct from one another. Something else seems to be needed, perhaps quantity. But to make quantity the principle of individuation will not resolve the problem, for this would be to reduce the principle that distinguishes one substance from others within the same species to the level of an accident. Godfrey notes that in the case of created immaterial beings (angels), their substantial form is also that by which they are individuals. He proposes, therefore, that in corporeal substances it is also the substantial form that serves as their principle of individuation. Nonetheless, quantity has its role to play as well since it is required in order to divide matter into distinct parts and thereby to enable it to receive and individuate substantial forms of the same kind. In other words, quantity disposes matter so as to enable it to function as the material principle of individuation. The formal cause or principle of a thing’s individuation is its substantial form. Quantity is not the formal principle of individuation, but it may be described as a quasi-material disposing cause of individuation because it disposes matter so that it can receive numerically distinct substantial forms (Wippel 1981, 349–64).

3. Natural Theology

3.1 Philosophical Knowledge of God’s Existence

According to Godfrey, insofar as a natural knowledge of God is accessible to human reason without divine revelation, it belongs more properly to metaphysics than does knowledge of any other being. And he clearly holds that God’s existence can be established by philosophical reasoning. But Avicenna and Averroes had differed concerning whether it belongs to natural philosophy (physics) or to metaphysics to demonstrate this conclusion. Avicenna had maintained that this task pertains to metaphysics and only to metaphysics, whereas Averroes had defended the opposite position that only physics can demonstrate the existence of God, the First Mover (Wippel 1981, 102–3). As will be seen more fully in section 3.2, Godfrey defends something of a compromise position. In Quodlibet XI, q. 1, he mentions that the metaphysician’s consideration of God is more perfect than that of the natural philosopher, for the metaphysician considers God in himself, while the natural philosopher views him merely as the First Mover of the first mobile being (i.e., of the outermost heavenly sphere). But Godfrey concedes that by reason of all that God is in himself, he is also the First Mover (PB 5.3). In Quodlibet V, q. 10, he writes that one can know by reasoning from natural things that God is the first being, which depends on nothing whatsoever and upon which everything else depends, and therefore that he is the causal and productive principle of all other things (PB 3.41; Wippel 1981, 105). And in Quodlibet IX, q. 20, he refers to different things that natural reason can know with certainty about God in metaphysics—that because he is the first being he is simple; that he is being in actuality; that he is an intellectual being, etc. (PB 4.288).

3.2 Quidditative Knowledge of God and the Divine Attributes

In Quodlibet VII, q. 11, Godfrey considers a certain view, presumably Aquinas’s, who holds that in this life we can know that God is, but not what he is. Godfrey makes a clear but implicit reference to Summa theologiae I, q. 3, a. 4, where Aquinas writes that even when we recognize that God is, the “is” that we understand is not the act of being whereby God subsists in himself, but only indicates that the proposition “that he is” is true (PB 3.383). Godfrey finds this too restrictive. And so, after offering a detailed explanation of the different ways in which one can know of something “what it is” and “that it is,” he writes that just as in knowing material things we move from more confused to less confused knowledge, so also it is in the case of our natural knowledge of God. Just as we find that some things are the principal causes of others and some are governed by others, so too we impose the name “God” to signify something in the universe which is the one first cause of everything else and which is that than which nothing greater can be thought. But such nominal knowledge is not enough to prove that what we express by the name “God” exists in reality or “that he is.” Next we may follow Aristotle’s procedure in Physics VII where, by eliminating recourse to an infinite regress of moved movers, he concludes that one First Mover or God exists. And from the continuous motion of the first mobile sphere, Aristotle shows in Physics VIII that God is perpetual and pure act. This tells us that God is in reality, but not what he is in any real sense. In Metaphysics XII, Godfrey continues, Aristotle accepts the knowledge “that God is” as proved in the Physics and now proceeds to show that certain perfections are present in God to a preeminent degree. According to Godfrey, Aristotle uses these perfections as quasi-differences and thereby progresses from knowledge “that God is” to knowledge of “what he is” by passing from a confused and quasi-generic knowledge to a more determined and quasi-specific knowledge. And so too, Godfrey proposes, we may reason, for instance, by first knowing him as a substance, then as an incorporeal substance, then as a living and intelligent incorporeal substance. He acknowledges that God does not really fall into any genus or species. Nonetheless, he maintains against Aquinas that we can know “what God is” in some real sense, even though he recognizes that in this life such knowledge will always be imperfect (PB 3.384–6; Wippel 1981, 108–15).

Consistent with the above, Godfrey defends the presence of a plurality of attributes in God even though, because of divine simplicity, these are only conceptually distinct from the divine essence and from one another. In Quodlibet VII, q. 1, he distinguishes two ways in which the term “attribute” may be taken. It may be used to signify a divine perfection in the sense that some creaturely perfection that does not imply any imperfection in and of itself—in other words, a pure perfection—is assigned to God to an eminent degree. Or it may be taken as signifying a pure perfection that is assigned to God as a “quasi-quality” and that perfects the divine substance in a “quasi-accidental” fashion. Godfrey comments that it is in this second sense that attributes are usually assigned to God, even though this is not intended to imply any real distinction or composition of substance and attribute in him. When taken in this second sense, Godfrey holds that there are many such quasi-qualities that perfect God in this quasi-accidental way, and therefore that there are many divine attributes. They are assigned to God in preeminent fashion because of his infinite perfection (PB 3.265).

In this same question, Godfrey was asked to resolve a still more fundamental issue. Because of God’s absolute simplicity, divine attributes signify perfections that are really identical with the divine essence and with one another. The conceptual distinction between them can only arise from an intellect’s consideration. But what is the ultimate foundation for this conceptual distinction? Does it arise from a consideration of God simply as he is in himself, or does it only result from some reference to really distinct realizations of these perfections in creatures? Godfrey replies that if one takes an attribute in the first sense mentioned above (as implying that every pure perfection present in creatures is to be assigned to God to an infinite degree), the answer is clear. The intellect, especially a created intellect, can arrive at such a conceptual distinction of divine attributes only by reasoning from the really distinct instantiations of such perfections in creatures (PB 3.267–70; Wippel 1981, 116–18). But what about the cognition of the divine attributes by the divine intellect? Godfrey then refers to and rejects the view of Henry of Ghent, according to whom attributes, when taken in the second sense (as quasi-qualities that perfect the divine substance), can be recognized as distinct and as multiple by God himself insofar as he views himself directly and without any reference to creatures. Against Henry, Godfrey maintains that not even God himself can be aware of this conceptual distinction between the divine attributes without referring to other beings in which these perfections are present in really distinct fashion. To hold otherwise would be to introduce too much distinction and diversity into the divine essence itself and would thereby compromise divine simplicity (PB 3.267–73; Wippel 1981, 118–23; Maurer 1999, 192–200).

4. Cognition and Epistemology

4.1 Theory of Abstraction

Like his contemporaries, Godfrey adopts the Aristotelian theory that intellectual cognition requires a “possible intellect” and an “agent intellect.” The possible intellect is the subject of cognition and is in potency to intelligibles; the agent intellect makes things perceived by sensory cognition intelligible by abstracting from them their individual features. According to Godfrey, the agent intellect and the possible intellect are distinct powers of the individual human soul. His theory of intellectual knowledge is based on the agent intellect’s ability to abstract potentially intelligible content from phantasms (images) produced by the imagination, an internal sense. The imagination depends upon the external senses for the data preserved in the phantasms. In Quodlibet V, q. 10, he makes a studied effort to explain in what the process of abstraction from phantasms consists as he responds to the question whether the agent intellect produces any positive disposition in the phantasm. One of the functions of the agent intellect is to illuminate phantasms so that they can move the possible intellect to understand. Because the possible intellect is at times only in potency with respect to an intelligible object, and because nothing can reduce itself from potency to act, it must be reduced to the act of understanding by something else. Hence the agent intellect must in some way enable phantasms to move or to actualize the possible intellect.

But, Godfrey argues, because phantasms exist in the imagination, require an organ, are individuated, and are therefore incapable of moving a purely spiritual power which knows in universal fashion, the agent intellect does not introduce any positive disposition into the phantasms. Such a disposition would itself be individuated and incapable of moving the possible intellect, which can only be moved by universals. He concludes, therefore, that the agent intellect operates on the phantasm simply by removing or separating or isolating one factor present therein from another: the universal quiddity from its individuating characteristics. What has been so removed or separated or abstracted is thereby rendered universal and capable of moving the possible intellect. In what would become a frequently cited illustration, he draws an analogy with milk, which possesses both color (white) and taste (sweet). If milk fully manifests itself to a knower, it does so as white and sweet. But light brings to the fore whiteness alone, without sweetness. Hence, because of the influence of light, one can speak of a kind of “abstraction” of the white from the sweet, although not in the sense that the two would then exist apart from one another. So, too, in the order of consideration, although not in the order of reality, the agent intellect separates or frees the quiddity presented in a phantasm from its individuating conditions and thereby reduces it from being only potentially intelligible—because it is singular—to being actually intelligible, as a universal quiddity, and capable of moving the possible intellect to understand. This freeing or abstracting process takes place because of a kind of spiritual contact with the light of the agent intellect (Wippel 1986).

Moreover, according to Godfrey, the abstracted quiddity or intelligible object is really the efficient cause of the possible intellect’s actual cognition of that object, just as the object of a sense power is the efficient cause of that sense power’s actual perception of its object. In both cases, this is again because of the impossibility of per se self-motion: nothing can reduce itself from potency to act. Godfrey, then, holds that the intellect is entirely passive in cognition, and he criticizes the views of those who assign an active role only to the intellect, not to the object (as held most famously by Peter Olivi, although Godfrey may not refer to him) and those who attribute an active role to both the object and the intellect (Thomas Aquinas and Giles of Rome). Cognition is brought about by the action of the object, but according to Godfrey, it is not itself an action or a passion; he rather understands sensory and intellectual cognition as a quality that is directed at an object—a position that will be highly influential on fourteenth-century thinkers. (Quodlibet VIII, q. 2, PB 4.30–3; Quodlibet IX, q. 19, PB 4.276–9; Quodlibet XIII, q. 3, PB 5.191–4, 200–2; see Wippel 1981,194–200; Côté 2007, especially on Quodlibet XII, q. 1; Hartman 2014; and, for the most complete account, Pini 2026).

4.2 Knowledge, Faith, and Opinion

To clarify the kind of certainty obtained in faith, Godfrey compares opinion, faith, and demonstrative knowledge (scientia). There are different grounds of certainty: Godfrey stresses evidence and authority, but he also mentions non-evidential reasons. Furthermore, there are two kinds of certainty: certainty of evidence and certainty of adhesion. Certainty of evidence derives from grasping what is evident. It includes certainty of adhesion, but not vice versa. The less an individual hesitates in assenting to a proposition as true, that is, the less the individual suspects it might be false, the more firmly he or she has certainty of adhesion regarding that proposition. Faith is grounded upon divine authority, which is infallible; it therefore yields a strong certainty of adhesion. On the scale of certainty, faith is thus between opinion, which is grounded upon human authority or upon weak reasons and thus yields only a weak certainty of adhesion or none at all, and demonstrative knowledge (scientia), which is based on evidence and thus has certainty of evidence and certainty of adhesion (Quodlibet IV, q. 10, PB 2.261–4; Quodlibet VIII, q. 7, PB 4.73; Faucher 2019, 273–90; Piché 2026). It is not possible to have demonstrative knowledge and faith regarding the same thing, for the former is based upon evidence, the latter upon authority (Quodlibet VIII, q. 7, PB 4.70, 73–7). These presuppositions determine Godfrey’s response to a question he is asked in his Quodlibet IX, q. 20: is natural philosophy more properly called a science than theology? Godfrey responds—against the majority view—that theology is not a science at all: a science is based upon evidence, theology is not. Even granted that it is a science, it would be so less properly than natural philosophy, because it is based upon less evident knowledge (PB 4.290–2; Faucher 2019, 277–86).

5. Moral Psychology and Ethics

5.1 Will and Freedom

Like Aquinas and most thinkers of the following decades, Godfrey understands the will as a “rational appetite,” a power of the soul that desires, chooses, and loves on the basis of intellectual cognition (e.g., Quodlibet VI, q. 7, PB 3.150; Quodlibet VIII, q. 16, PB 4.142–5, 155–6). This means that the object of the will is something the intellect apprehends as good and suitable, in contrast to the object of the “sensory appetite,” which is something the senses apprehend as good (Quodlibet VI, q. 1, PB 3.95–6; q. 10, PB 3.220). The will cannot will anything unless it is presented under the aspect of the good, whether it is a true or an apparent good (Quodlibet VI, q. 1, PB 3.101; Quodlibet X, q. 13, PB 4.368). Beyond these fundamental points, there is hardly an aspect of Godfrey’s theory of the will that was not subject to controversy in his time.

A key point in Godfrey’s theory of the will is that the will’s acts are caused by the object presented to it. The willed object, for example health, has a threefold being: (1) in its remote cause, such as the consideration about one’s sickness and about the nature of health, which can move the individual to think of health as something good to have; (2) through this thought, the object (health) has cognized being in the intellect, which is followed in the will by love for it; (3) when health is attained, the object has being in its own existence outside the soul, that is, apart from being thought of (Quodlibet XV, q. 3, PB 14.13). For Godfrey, the object in its cognized being moves the will as an efficient cause, whereas insofar as it exists (or will exist) in itself, outside the soul, the object moves the will as a final cause (Quodlibet VI, q. 7, PB 3.164; Quodlibet VIII, q. 16, PB 4.174–5). Since the object also causes the species of the will’s act (health-willing rather than money-willing), it is furthermore its formal cause (Quodlibet VI, q. 11, PB 3.221).

It is mainly in response to Henry of Ghent that Godfrey emphasizes the genuine causality of the cognized object as the efficient cause of the will’s act, just as the object is the efficient cause of the act of cognition (section 4.1). Henry’s theory of the cause of the will’s act—that the will is itself the efficient cause of its act because it moves itself directly to will something without being moved by its object—is unacceptable to Godfrey because such self-motion would violate the act-potency axiom, as we have seen (section 2.3). Godfrey develops several arguments that if, per impossibile, the will could move itself directly, choice would actually be less free than if one maintains with him that the will is moved by its object and then moves the apprehensive powers to their respective acts and, by means of such motions, indirectly moves itself to its volition. One of his arguments concerns the metaphysics of self-motion. If the will were a self-mover that moves itself directly to its acts, then the active and passive principle causing the will’s acts would be identical, leaving no room for impediments and thus eliminating any control (dominium) of the acts. The other arguments concern the role of cognition in free choice. At their core is the idea that if the will’s acts were caused by the will itself, then the role of the cognized object would be minimized or even eliminated, which has several implications that diminish or even destroy free choice: the inclination of the will would not be different from the inclination of a natural appetite, which acts without cognition and by which one has no control of one’s acts. Furthermore, deliberation would play no role in choicemaking, while it is precisely by deliberation that one controls one’s acts (as we will see shortly in more detail). In addition, cognition grounds free choice because it presents a good as a universal rather than as something particular; the good seen as a universal makes room for a certain indifference, that is, for alternative possibilities, whereas particular goods move an appetite in a determinate and necessary way (Quodlibet XV, q. 4, PB 14.23–9).

The cognized object, then, is crucial for free choice, and there is no willing that is not caused by it. We can will an end (e.g., health) and we can will—that is, choose—a specific means (e.g., applying an ointment). In the two cases the object is cognized differently: willing an end does not require that the object be cognized by means of deliberation, whereas choosing a means presupposes deliberation. Godfrey follows Aristotle (and Aquinas) in making deliberation central to choicemaking. Deliberation is practical reasoning about which means is most suitable to an end we desire; it is what narrows down various candidates for suitable means to a single one, which is the one we choose (cf. EN III.2–3). Following John of Damascus, Godfrey and his contemporaries add that deliberation concludes in a judgment about what is to be chosen—a judgment made “all things considered,” as Godfrey adds. So, for Godfrey, the cognized object that causes the will to choose a means (rather than to will an end) is what the judgment concluding deliberation affirms as to be chosen. Godfrey insists repeatedly that our will cannot choose differently from this judgment—especially against Henry of Ghent, who claimed that the will remains free to will in conformity with or contrary to it. For Godfrey, this necessary conformity between our judgment and our choice seems to follow from the fact that the will’s choice is efficiently caused by the cognized object as articulated in the judgment that concludes deliberation (Quodlibet VI, q. 7, PB 3.160; Quodlibet VIII, q. 16, PB 4.161; Quodlibet X, q. 11, PB 4.352–3). He gives two further arguments. First, if we could will differently from our all-things-considered judgment, we would simultaneously will the desired end and not will it: we would will it because we desire it and we would not will it because we do not want what we judge to be the means to obtain it (Quodlibet VI, q. 1, PB 3.101–2; Quodlibet X, q. 11, PB 4.352–3; Quaestiones ordinariae 1, PB 14.82–3). Second, our willing contrary to our judgment would lack an object—we would will without willing something—for the object of the will coincides with the object of the practical intellect as expressed in that judgment (Quodlibet VI, q. 10, PB 4.202 and 204–5; Hoffmann 2026, 42–7). According to Godfrey, one can only choose differently from the all-things-considered judgment in virtue of a new judgment, that is—it is implied—by prolonging our deliberation so as obtain a new concluding judgment (Quodlibet XII, q. 2, PB 5.88).

For Godfrey’s adversaries, positing the cognized object as the efficient cause of the act of willing entails cognitive determinism: How do we control what we choose if this choice depends on what we cognize? A supposition in this objection is that, in a given context, the intellect is not free to cognize in one way or another, so that, if the will’s acts depend on what the intellect cognizes as most suitable to be willed, then the will’s acts are not caused freely. Godfrey contests this supposition and argues instead that the intellect is no less free than the will (Quodlibet VI, q. 10, PB 3.207; Quodlibet VIII, q. 16, PB 4.150). For Godfrey, what grounds the control of our acts of the will is deliberation. Since the cognized object that moves the will is the product of deliberation, and since we control our deliberation because we can dwell upon or repel the considerations that occur to us during our deliberation, we also control the choice we make according to the result of our deliberation (Quodlibet V, q. 12, PB 3.51–2; Quodlibet VI, q. 7, PB 160; Quodlibet VIII, q. 16, PB 4.164; Quodlibet XV, q. 4, PB 14.29–31).

(For Godfrey’s theory of the will and free will, see Putallaz 1995, 184–7, 198–208, 233–47; Leone 2017a and 2017b; Hoffmann 2021, 105–18; Hoffmann 2023; Szlachta 2023 and 2026.)

5.2 Beatitude

Beatitude or happiness is the supreme human perfection, the ultimate end, that is, what is most desired. Contrary to those who hold that beatitude consists in the love of God and hence in an act of the will, Godfrey argues that, to the extent that it involves an act, it can only consist in an act of the intellect. Human perfection is had not in willing—one does not will for the sake of willing—but in the object of willing. The most desired object of the will, the highest good, consists in an act of the intellect: seeing God. Even those who insist that love is central to happiness should admit that happiness consists in an act of the intellect. Friendship-love is to will the same good for another that one wishes for oneself, and this good, for the reasons just seen, can only be an act of the intellect, not of the will. Incidentally, for Godfrey these considerations show that the intellect is a more eminent power than the will (Quodlibet VI, q. 8, PB 3.174–6 and q. 10, PB 3.190–3, 212, 215–16). Since the will’s acts are caused by the cognized object, the blessed in the beatific vision of the afterlife, who have perfect cognition of God as the highest and most desirable goodness, necessarily love him. Still, cognizing God and willing God remain distinct; therefore, by his absolute power God could make it so that someone who sees him does not love him (Quodlibet VI, q. 1, PB 3.101–8; Osborne 2013). Even though the blessed love God necessarily, they do so freely and laudably, for freedom does not require alternative possibilities, but rather willing what is good because it is good (Quodlibet VIII, q. 16, PB 4.163–4). In the beatific vision there are different degrees of knowledge and therefore of blessedness, for seeing God includes what is necessarily implied in God’s nature (e.g., that he is triune), but it does not include the determinations of his will (e.g., how many human beings he creates); thus, God can reveal his mysteries to some and not to others (Quodlibet XV, q. 5, PB 14.34–8). (On Godfrey’s theory of beatitude, see Neumann 1958, 121–43.)

5.3 Virtues

In the ethics of Godfrey of Fontaines, the virtues play a major role. He shares a number of general assumptions about the virtues with his contemporaries: there are divinely infused virtues, especially the theological virtues of faith, hope, and charity, by which an individual is ordered to God, and there are humanly acquired moral virtues, by which one is ordered to oneself and to others, such as temperance, fortitude, justice, and liberality; furthermore, there are intellectual virtues, e.g., scientific knowledge, prudence, and art (or craft knowledge).

With reference to Aristotle’s claim that virtuous actions involve knowing what one is doing, choosing it and choosing it for its own sake, and acting from a firm character (EN II.4.1105a28–34), Godfrey investigates whether acts of virtue consist formally in the choice one makes internally or in the external performance of the act. He argues that the “formally virtuous act” consists in the internal, not the external, act: the formally virtuous act of prudence consists in an act of the practical intellect while that of moral virtue consists in an act of choice, taken broadly to include both the act of the will and the inclination of the sensory appetite. The external act, that is, the bodily performance of the action, may well be called moral even if the virtuous internal act is lacking, but it may not be called formally virtuous. Nevertheless, a good action that involves the interior and the exterior act is more perfect and more meritorious than an action that is only exercised internally without being performed externally (Quaestiones ordinariae 1, PB 14.84–9).

Godfrey takes a unique stance on an issue that was debated in his time: which part of the soul is the subject of the virtues? That is, which part of the soul needs to be perfected by virtuous habitus in order to guarantee that the individual not only performs certain virtuous acts in conformity with right reason, but also performs them in a virtuous way, namely promptly, with ease, and with pleasure? According to Aquinas, some virtues (e.g., temperance and fortitude) are located in the sensory appetite, which must be habituated to follow the dictate of right reason, while others (e.g., justice and charity) are located in the will to facilitate good action beyond the scope of oneself, that is, in the relation to one’s neighbor and to God. According to others, e.g., Henry of Ghent and Gonsalvus of Spain, all the moral virtues are located in the will, for in their view the will does not follow the dictates of reason by nature and therefore must be habituated to do so. Godfrey of Fontaines locates all the moral virtues in the sensory appetite. As we have seen, he holds that the will follows the dictate of reason naturally and cannot will differently from what the intellect judges worth willing. Consequently, no habitus is required to make the will follow reason promptly. Instead, the sensory appetite needs to be habituated, not only to follow the dictates of reason promptly, but also so that the correct dictate not be impeded by contrary desires of the sensory appetite. For Godfrey, justice, too, has its subject in the sensory appetite (Quodlibet XIV, q. 3, PB 5.342–4; Quaestiones ordinariae 1, PB 14.84–5). There is a virtue, however, that Godfrey locates in the will: charity. This virtue is in the will not to strengthen it in following the intellect, but rather to cause a conformity in the will toward the lovable things; this conformity facilitates the intellect’s apprehension of the things to be loved by charity under the aspect of the good and suitable (Quodlibet XI, q. 4, PB 5.23–4). (On Godfrey’s claim that the sensory appetite is the subject of the virtues, see Kent 1995, 236–7; Wippel 2006, 317–20; and Dumont 2026.)

Another important topic that was debated at the time is the connection or interdependence of the virtues. Godfrey of Fontaines affirms this connection, in two senses: (1) the moral virtues are connected through prudence; (2) the moral virtues are connected among themselves. (1) Largely following Aristotle, Godfrey argues that the moral virtues and prudence are essentially connected, for each moral virtue requires prudence, by which one makes virtuous choices toward the due end, while prudence requires the moral virtues, which safeguard the correct assessment of the due end. The correct assessment of the end depends on the virtues because the way an end appears to us depends on the way in which we are disposed by our sensory appetite, which inclines us in accordance with the passions we experience and the habitus that inform it. For this reason, vices dispose us to judge those ends worth pursuing that are congruent with the vices, while virtues dispose us to judge virtuous ends to be worthwhile. (2) Furthermore, the moral virtues are connected among themselves indirectly by sustaining each other: the possession of all the virtues allows us to do the acts of each virtue with delight, whereas vice in one domain can tempt us away from virtue in another domain, such as when a chaste and greedy person renounces chastity when offered a large sum of money (Quodlibet II, q. 11, PB 2.147–51; Quodlibet V, q. 12, PB 3.50–2; Quodlibet XIV, q. 3, PB 5.351–2; Quaestiones ordinariae 4, ed. Lottin 1954a, 583). As to the first kind of connection, through prudence, Godfrey insists that the prudence that connects all moral virtues is a single habitus for all the moral virtues, rather than each moral virtue having its own prudence, as some contemporaries held. Aquinas, too, insisted on the unity of prudence regarding all the moral virtues, but for Godfrey, the unity of prudence does not even allow for different kinds of prudence, as Aquinas had held. Aquinas understands the Aristotelian division of prudence into personal, domestic, and political prudence as a division into different species, in such a way that one might have personal prudence but not political prudence; Godfrey insists that it is one and the same habitus of prudence by which one is fit to govern oneself, the household, and the political community. That is why the prudence of rulers and subjects does not differ in kind, only possibly in degree, and when a virtuous person becomes a ruler, his or her prudence does not change in itself but is only employed more broadly (Quaestiones ordinariae 3, PB 14.129–37; Quaestiones ordinariae 5, ed. Lottin 1954a, 595–6; Lambertini 2002 and, more briefly, Lambertini 2006, 441–4; Stöpfgeshoff 2026).

Godfrey also discusses the connection between naturally acquired moral virtues and the supernatural theological virtues of faith, hope, and charity. He holds that the acquired moral virtues and the theological virtues are essentially independent; an individual can have one set without the other. Nevertheless, the acquired moral virtues are had more perfectly if one possesses charity, by which one refers one’s virtuous actions not only to the good of the community but also to God. Furthermore, the acquired moral virtues dispose an individual toward the theological virtues and vice versa (Quaestiones ordinariae 19, ed. Lottin 1954b, 114–22; Kempshall 1999, 229–32, Leone 2026, 297–304).

5.4 Moral Goodness and Conscience

Godfrey assumes, like his contemporaries, that there is an objective moral order, governed by natural law, according to which certain acts are generically and in themselves good (such as honoring one’s parents) and others evil (such as homicide, adultery, and theft). He holds that this moral order can be known by all. Whether specific acts count as homicide, adultery, or theft, however, can change by divine authority: when God commanded the Israelites to despoil the Egyptians (Exodus 11:2–3 and 12:35–6), this was not theft, nor was this act evil in itself (Quodlibet IV, q. 11, PB 2.265–6). What allows everyone to know the moral order in general is that, even though one’s affections may be disordered and hence one’s particular judgment may be distorted, the natural inclination to the good in general and the knowledge of the first principles of action remain always intact. Because of the inclination to the good and cognition of the first practical principles, even those whose appetites are disordered because of vice can apply the general principles correctly, act contrary to their vicious inclinations, and make moral progress toward virtue (Quodlibet V, q. 12, PB 3.54–60).

Like Aquinas, Godfrey connects the knowledge of the first principles of action to the traditional notion of synderesis; both thinkers thus understand synderesis as a habitual moral awareness of the general moral principles. Examples of these are “One must avoid doing what is contrary to a divine precept” and “One must do what contributes to the preservation of the city.” Moral conscience, that is, the cognition that something particular is to be done or avoided, results from applying the general moral knowledge expressed in these principles, or deduced from them, to particular cases. A correct application—e.g., it is bad to fornicate because one must not act against a divine precept—results in a correct conscience; a mistaken application—e.g., it is good to fornicate with this woman because this will help preserve the city—results in an erroneous conscience (the examples are Godfrey’s).

The possibility of an erroneous conscience leads to the much-discussed question of whether acting against one’s erroneous conscience, and thereby de facto doing what is right, is better than acting in accord with it and thus doing what is wrong. Godfrey, like Aquinas, holds that acting against one’s erring conscience is worse, for then one acts contrary to what one thinks is to be done or avoided, and so one wills to do something one thinks is bad, which means subjectively to will evil and to despise the moral law.

What interests Godfrey much more, however, is a question to which his contemporaries paid little or no attention: whether it is possible to act against one’s conscience in the first place. As we have seen, Godfrey denies that one can will contrary to the intellect’s particular practical judgment; conscience is a particular practical judgment; so it seems one cannot will and act against it as long as the judgment of conscience remains unchanged. To address this difficulty, Godfrey makes a distinction: the judgment of conscience can be either complete and perfect, or cognized only habitually without being considered. In the first case, it is impossible to act against one’s conscience; in the second case, it is possible.

Godfrey’s explanation of how one can act against one’s conscience resembles Aquinas’s explanation of incontinent action in Summa theologiae I-II, q. 77, a. 2 and De malo q. 3, a. 9. According to Godfrey, when one acts against one’s conscience, one simultaneously has two contrary cognitions: one dictating that one do or avoid a certain action, another dictating the contrary. These two cognitions depend on two contrary major premises for a practical syllogism, which express two contrary ends. Depending on which end the intellect apprehends in the moment as more congruent and better and which end the will therefore desires most, an individual reasons from one or the other major premise, and hence he or she arrives at the corresponding conclusion about what to do or avoid. It is important to Godfrey that the two contrary judgments are simultaneously present in one’s mind, for otherwise one would never act against one’s conscience so long as that conscience remains unchanged.

Godfrey uses an example inspired by Anselm of Canterbury to illustrate the mental process by which one acts against one’s conscience. In a situation in which one can only evade the threat of death by lying, one may judge—correctly in Godfrey’s view—that lying should be avoided because of love for truth (reasoning from the first major premise: truth is to be upheld even at the cost of life); and one can at the same time judge that one should lie to save one’s life (reasoning from the second major premise: one’s life is to be saved even at the cost of lying). The all-things-considered judgment that leads to the corresponding choice and action is the latter, for it results from a reasoning in which one combines the two contrary major premises into one: “That which is evil and to be avoided because of the love of truth, but which is good because of the conservation of temporal life, is to be done; lying, though evil because it is contrary to truth, is nonetheless good because it conserves life; hence it is to be done.” A virtuous individual, whose appetites are rightly ordered, would rank the major premises differently and conclude that what is contrary to truth is to be avoided at any cost. With this explanation, Godfrey is able to uphold his theory that the will’s choice necessarily conforms to the intellect’s particular judgment even in the case of acting against one’s conscience: one acts against the judgment of one’s conscience in virtue of a different, contrary practical judgment (Quodlibet XII, q. 2, PB 5.83–91; Leone 2019, 136–60; Leone 2026, 287–93).

6. Political Philosophy

6.1 Common Good

In Quodlibet X, q. 6, in responding to the question whether human beings naturally judge that one should love God more than oneself, Godfrey discusses both the love of God and the love of the common good. The two are closely related, for God is the most universal common good of all things, both in terms of his causality that extends to all things (virtute) and in terms of his perfection that contains all things in an eminent way (perfectione). An individual naturally loves the common good more than him or herself because of a twofold relation between the common good and the personal good: the personal good is included in the common good, that is, in God or in the political common good, and it depends on it. That human beings naturally love the common good more than the private good means that they have a natural inclination toward it, that they naturally judge it to be preferable, and that they actually love it more as long as their sins and carnal desires do not make them love themselves more. Moreover, human beings also love the common good more than themselves by charity, that is, by a love perfected by grace; and this fact confirms the natural preference for the common good over one’s own good, for grace perfects nature and does not destroy it (PB 4.318–19; see also Quodlibet XIII, q. 1, PB 5.182–4).

Two objections that express the views of Godfrey’s contemporaries and that claim the authority of Aristotle allow Godfrey to elaborate on these ideas. According to EN IX.8.1169a18–22, when one acts virtuously, one secures the good of virtue for oneself, which is a greater good than any good one obtains by non-virtuous acts or by vicious acts. So it seems to follow that when one does laudable things, even at the cost of death, one loves oneself more than God and the common good, because one is securing for oneself the greater good. Godfrey grants that one cannot will or love anything without thereby also loving oneself. He also grants that by loving God and the common good, one gains the good of virtue. But the virtuous love of God and virtuous acts that are done for the common good are not motivated by this gain, for one would do them no less if one did not gain anything from them. Nevertheless—because one cannot obtain a greater good for oneself than the good of virtue implied in loving God and the common good above all—in so loving, one incidentally loves oneself more than by preferring oneself (Quodlibet X, q. 6, PB 4.319–24).

A second objection is based on EN IX.4.1166a1–2, according to which one’s friendly relations with others stem from the friendly relations one has to oneself. If this is so, then it seems that, since the cause is greater than the effect, the love of self must be greater than the love of God and of other human beings that springs from this self-love. Godfrey responds by making a distinction: friendship in the proper sense is between equals, and Aristotle’s affirmation applies only to this type of friendship. The relation to God—and to parents and fatherland—is friendship only broadly taken, insofar as it extends to those who are more eminent and on whom one depends for one’s being and conduct. And so, by nature, one loves God more than oneself, for God is the common good of which one is in a sense a part and on which one depends (Quodlibet X, q. 6, PB 4.318–19 and p. 325). (For the love of God and the common good, see Kempshall 1999, 209–19; Osborne 2005, ch. 4, esp. 138–50 and 163–70).

The moral virtue that is concerned with the common good is legal justice, which is a “general virtue” insofar as it is obtained by the acts of the other moral virtues (e.g., acts of temperance, of courage, etc.), without itself having a proper act. Legal justice (justice as a general virtue) is distinct from particular justice (justice as a “special virtue”). Justice, in whichever sense it is taken, orders one’s relations to others. Legal justice concerns others taken collectively, as members of the political community, and thus aims at the common good of the whole community, of which the individual citizen is an integral part (i.e., component); particular justice concerns determinate human beings in exchanges of goods (e.g., in selling and buying) and aims at fairness. Particular justice is subdivided into commutative justice and distributive justice. Godfrey develops these ideas on the basis of Aristotle’s distinction in EN V.1 between justice as the whole of virtue (Godfrey’s legal justice) and justice as a part of virtue (Godfrey’s particular justice). (Quodlibet XIV, q. 1, PB 5.303–14; see also Kempshall 1999, 220–6; Wippel 2006, 304–8.)

6.2 Political Authority and Its Limits

A question Godfrey was asked in Quodlibet XI gave him the opportunity to profess his mature thought about political authority. He was asked whether the political leader can oblige his subjects to pay a tax for the utility of the state even if this utility is not manifest (q. 17). The historical context is a tax Philip the Fair raised to wage war. Godfrey premises his answer with reflections about political authority and good government. Since rulers should be the most virtuous and prudent, they should be instituted by election rather than by inheritance. Their task is to promote the good of the community rather than their private good. Hence, if they impose a heavy burden on the community, the utility must be manifest and they must obtain the consent of their subjects; otherwise, their subjects can rightfully refuse to obey. Furthermore, to assess the necessity of imposing a burden on the community, the ruler must be advised by prudent and impartial counselors, who are only found outside the rulers’ entourage. If this is not the case, the subjects must resist if they can, in order to prevent the government from developing gradually into a tyranny. Godfrey pessimistically observes that such resistance rarely happens, for some subjects are pusillanimous, while others are corrupt. (See Lagarde 1943–5, 118–21; Kempshall 1999, 247–56, esp. 252–6; Grandjean 2026, 342–9. For a survey of Godfrey’s views on political, ecclesiastical, and theological authority and obligations, see Marmursztejn 2006.)

Bibliography

Works by Godfrey

  • Godfrey of Fontaines. Les Philosophes Belges, Leuven: Institut Supérieur de Philosophie de l’Université.
    • Vol. 2 (=PB 2): Les quatre premiers Quodlibets de Godefroid de Fontaines (1904), Maurice De Wulf, Auguste Pelzer, eds.
    • Vol. 3: Les Quodlibets cinq, six et sept (1914), Maurice De Wulf, Jean Hoffmans, eds.
    • Vol. 4: Le huitième Quodlibet, le neuvième Quodlibet, le dixième Quodlibet (1924, 1928, 1931), Jean Hoffmans, ed.
    • Vol 5: Les Quodlibets onze et douze, Les Quodlibets treize et quatorze (1932, 1935), Jean Hoffmans, ed.
    • Vol. 14: Le Quodlibet XV et trois Questions ordinaires de Godefroid de Fontaines (1937), Odon Lottin, ed.
  • Godfrey of Fontaines. Disputed Questions. Some have been edited in scattered publications. For a list, see Aiello 2026, 52–6.

Secondary Literature

  • Aiello, Andrea, 2026, “Godfrey of Fontaines’s Life, Career, and Library”, in Antoine Côté, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill, pp. 11–75.
  • –––, and Robert Wielockx, 2008, Goffredo di Fontaines, aspirante baccelliere sentenziario: le autografe “Notulae de scientia theologie” e la cronologia del ms. Paris BnF lat. 16297 (Corpus Christianorum Autographa Medii Aevi: Volume 6), Turnhout: Brepols.
  • Celeyrette, Jean and Solère, Jean-Luc, 2002, “Godefroid de Fontaines et la théorie de la succession dans l’intensification des formes”, in Paul J.J.M. Bakker (ed.), with Emmanuel Faye and Christophe Grellard, Chemins de la Pensée Médiévale: Études offertes à Zénon Kaluza (Textes et Etudes du Moyen Âge: Volume 20), Fédération Internationale des Instituts d’Études Médiévales, Turnhout: Brepols, pp. 79–112.
  • –––, 2009, “Édition de la question ordinaire No. 18, ‘De intensione virtutum’, de Godefroid de Fontaines”, in José F. Meirinhos and Olga Weijers (eds.), Florilegium mediaevale: Études offertes à Jacqueline Hamesse à l’occasion de son éméritat, Louvain-la-Neuve: Fédération Internationale des Instituts d’Études Médiévales, pp. 83–107.
  • Côté, Antoine, 2007, “L’objet et la cause de la connaissance selon Godefroid de Fontaines”, Freiburger Zeitschrift für Philosophie und Theologie, 54(3): 409–29.
  • –––, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), 2026, A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill.
  • Cross, Richard, 2002, The Metaphysics of the Incarnation, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Dales, Richard C., 1990, Medieval Discussions of the Eternity of the World (Brill’s Studies in Intellectual History: Volume 18), Leiden: Brill.
  • de Lagarde, Georges, 1943–1945, “La philosophie sociale d’Henri de Gand et de Godefroid de Fontaines”, Archives d’histoire doctrinale et littéraire du Moyen Âge, 14: 73–142, 607–8.
  • De Wulf, Maurice, 1904, Un théologien-philosophe du XIIIe siècle: Étude sur la vie, les œuvres et l’influence de Godefroid de Fontaines, Brussels: M. Hayez.
  • Donati, Silvia, 2026, “Giles of Rome, Godfrey of Fontaines, and Hervaeus Natalis on Celestial Matter”, in Antoine Côté, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill, pp. 138–71.
  • Duin, J.J., 1959, “La bibliothèque philosophique de Godefroid de Fontaines”, Estudios Lulianos, 3: 21–36, 136–60.
  • Dumont, Stephen D., 2009, “Godfrey of Fontaines and the Succession Theory of Forms at Paris in the Early Fourteenth Century”, in Stephen F. Brown, Thomas Dewender, and Theo Kobusch (eds.), Philosophical Debates at Paris in the Earlier Fourteenth Century (Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters: Volume 102), Leiden: Brill, pp. 39–125.
  • –––, 2026, “The Disputation at the University of Paris between Godfrey of Fontaines and John Duns Scotus on Virtues in the Will”, in Garrett R. Smith and Wouter Goris (eds.), John Duns Scotus and His Parisian Interlocutors (Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters: Volume 142), Leiden: Brill, pp. 122–85.
  • Faucher, Nicolas, 2019, La volonté de croire au Moyen Âge: Les théories de la foi dans la pensée scolastique du XIIIe siècle (Studia Sententiarum: Volume 4), Turnhout: Brepols.
  • Field, Sean L., 2009, “The Master and Marguerite: Godfrey of Fontaines’ Praise of The Mirror of Simple Souls”, Journal of Medieval History, 35: 136–49.
  • Grandjean, Alban, 2019, “Une relecture de la philosophie politique et sociale de Godefroid de Fontaines (ca. 1250–1306)”, Revue Philosophique de Louvain 117: 609–52.
  • –––, 2026, “Godfrey of Fontaines’s Political Philosophy”, in Antoine Côté, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill, pp. 338–61.
  • Hartman, Peter, 2014, “Causation and Cognition: Durand of St.-Pourçain and Godfrey of Fontaines on the Cause of a Cognitive Act”, in Andreas Speer, Fiorella Retucci, Thomas Jeschke, and Guy Guldentops (eds.), Durand of Saint-Pourçain and His Sentences Commentary: Historical, Philosophical, and Theological Issues (Recherches de Théologie et Philosophie médiévales – Bibliotheca: Volume 9), Leuven: Peters, pp. 229–56.
  • Hoffmann, Tobias, 2021, Free Will and the Rebel Angels in Medieval Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 2023, “Deliberation and Rival Accounts of Free Choice in Medieval Philosophy”, History of Philosophy Quarterly, 40: 132–62.
  • –––, 2026, “L’acte de la volonté, est-il nécessairement conforme au jugement pratique particulier? Thomas d’Aquin, Henri de Gand, Godefroid de Fontaines et Duns Scot en dialogue”, in Kristell Trego (ed.), Object of Thought, Object of the Will: From Richard Rufus of Cornwall to Anton Marty (Dokimion: Volume 43), Münster: Aschendorff, pp. 31–54.
  • Kempshall, Matthew S., 1999, The Common Good in Late Medieval Political Philosophy, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Kent, Bonnie, 1995, Virtues of the Will: The Transformation of Ethics in the Late Thirteenth-Century, Washington, DC: Catholic University of American Press.
  • König-Pralong, Catherine, 2005, Avènement de l’aristotélisme en terre chrétienne: l’essence et la matière: entre Thomas d’Aquin et Guillaume d’Ockham (Études de philosophie médiévale: Volume 87), Paris: Vrin.
  • Lambertini, Roberto, 2002, “Est autem et politica et prudencia, idem quidem habitus: Appunti sul rapporto tra prudentia e politica in alcuni interpreti medievali del VI libro dell’Etica nicomachea (da Alberto Magno a Buridano)”, Etica & Politica 4(2). [Lambertini 2002 available online]
  • –––, 2006, “Political Quodlibeta”, in Chris Schabel (ed.), Theological Quodlibeta in the Middle Ages: The Thirteenth Century (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 1), Leiden: Brill, pp. 439–74.
  • Leone, Marialucrezia, 2017a, “‘Non quaecumque necessitas excludit libertatem’. Goffredo di Fontaines e la libertà della volontà e dell’intelletto”, Medioevo 42: 187–225.
  • –––, 2017b, “Utrum voluntas moveat se ipsam: Goffredo di Fontaines e l’automovimento della volontà”, in Marialucrezia Leone and Luisa Valente (eds.), Libertà e determinismo: Riflessioni medievali (Flumen sapientiae: Volume 4), Canterano: Aracne, pp. 259–307.
  • –––, 2019, Sinderesi: La conoscenza immediata dei principi morali tra Medioevo e prima Età Moderna (Flumen sapientiae: Volume 12), Canterano: Aracne.
  • –––, 2026, “Godfrey of Fontaines and the Possibility of a Natural Morality”, in Antoine Côté, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill, pp. 280–306.
  • Lottin, Odon, 1954a, “La connexion des vertus morales acquises de saint Thomas d’Aquin à Jean Duns Scot”, in Psychologie et Morale aux XIIe et XIIIe siècles, vol. 4, 551–663, Leuven: Abbaye du Mont César; Gembloux: J. Duculot.
  • –––, 1954b, “Les vertus morales acquises sont-elles de vraies vertus? La réponse des théologiens de saint Thomas à Pierre Auriol”, Recherches de théologie ancienne et médiévale 21: 101–29.
  • Maier, Anneliese, 1951 [1968], Zwei Grundprobleme der scholastischen Naturphilosophie: Das Problem der intensiven Größe, Die Impetustheorie, Rome: Edizione di storia e letteratura, 2nd edition, 1951; revised 3rd edition, 1968.
  • Marmursztejn, Elsa, 2006, “A Normative Power in the Making”, in Chris Schabel (ed.), Theological Quodlibeta in the Middle Ages: The Thirteenth Century (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 1), Leiden: Brill, pp. 345–402.
  • Marrone, Steven P., 2001, The Light of Thy Countenance: Science and Knowledge of God in the Thirteenth Century. Volume 2: God at the Core of Cognition (Studies in the History of Christian Traditions: Volume 98), Leiden: Brill.
  • Maurer, Armand, 1999, The Philosophy of William of Ockham in Light of Its Principles, Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies.
  • Neumann, Bernhard, 1958, Der Mensch und die himmlische Seligkeit nach der Lehre Gottfrieds von Fontaines, Limburg: Lahn-Verlag.
  • Osborne, Jr., Thomas M., 2005, Love of Self and Love of God in Thirteenth-Century Ethics, Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
  • –––, 2013, “Giles of Rome, Henry of Ghent, and Godfrey of Fontaines on Whether to See God is to Love Him”, Recherches de Théologie et Philosophie médiévales, 80: 57–76.
  • Paulus, Jean, 1938, Henri de Gand: Essai sur les tendances de sa métaphysique, Paris: Vrin.
  • Piché, David, 2026, “Epistemology and the Psychology of Faith in Godfrey of Fontaines”, in Antoine Côté, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill, pp. 211–52.
  • Pickavé, Martin, 2026, “Godfrey of Fontaines on Metaphysics”, in Antoine Côté, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill, pp. 109–37.
  • Pini, Giorgio, 2026, “Godfrey of Fontaines on Cognition”, in Antoine Côté, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill, pp. 172–210.
  • Porro, Pasquale, 1996, “Possibilità ed Esse essentiae in Enrico di Gand”, in Willy Vanhamel (ed.), Henry of Ghent: Proceedings of the International Colloquium on the Occasion of the 700th Anniversary of His Death (1293), Leuven: Leuven University Press, pp. 211–53.
  • Putallaz, François-Xavier, 1995, Insolente liberté: Controverses et condemnations au XIIIe siècle, Fribourg: Éditions Universitaires/Paris: Cerf.
  • Stöpfgeshoff, Alexander, 2026, “Can Prudence Connect the Virtues? Godfrey of Fontaines on the Unity of Prudence”, History of Philosophy & Logical Analysis, (published online ahead of print). doi:10.30965/26664275-bja10130
  • Sylla, Edith Dudley, 1981, “Godfrey of Fontaines on Motion with Respect to Quantity of the Eucharist”, in Alfonso Maierù and Agostino Paravicini Bagliani (eds.), Studi sul XIV secolo in memoria di Anneliese Maier (Storia e Letteratura, Raccolta di studi e testi: Volume 151), Rome: Edizioni di Storia e Letteratura, pp. 105–41.
  • Szlachta, Michael, 2023, “How Do Intellect and Will Interact? Thomas Aquinas, Godfrey of Fontaines, and the Determination-Exercise Distinction”, in Monika Michałowska and Riccardo Fedriga (eds.), Willing and Understanding: Late Medieval Debates on the Will, the Intellect, and Practical Knowledge (Investigating Medieval Philosophy: Volume 19), Leiden: Brill, pp. 62–83.
  • –––, 2026, “Freedom from the Ground Up: The Intellectualism of Godfrey of Fontaines”, in Antoine Côté, Martin Pickavé, and Michael Szlachta (eds.), A Companion to Godfrey of Fontaines (Brill’s Companions to the Christian Tradition: Volume 113), Leiden: Brill, pp. 253–79.
  • Wielockx, Robert, 2009, Boethii Daci Quaestiones super Librum De anima I–II with Gianfranco Fioravanti, Anonymi Boethio Daco Usi Quaestiones Metaphysicae (Corpus Philosophorum Danicorum Medii Aevi: Volume 14), Copenhagen: University Press of Southern Denmark.
  • –––, 2014, “Henri de Gand et Gilles de Rome à la lumière de la bibliothèque de Godefroid de Fontaines”, in Valérie Cordonier and Tiziana Suarez-Nani (eds.), L’Aristotélisme exposé: aspects du débat philosophique entre Henri de Gand et Gilles de Rome, Fribourg: Academic Press, pp. 181–259.
  • Wippel, John F., 1973, “Godfrey of Fontaines and the Act-Potency Axiom”, Journal of the History of Philosophy, 11: 299–317.
  • –––, 1979, “Godfrey of Fontaines on Intension and Remission of Accidental Forms”, Franciscan Studies, 39: 316–55.
  • –––, 1981, The Metaphysical Thought of Godfrey of Fontaines: A Study in Late Thirteenth-Century Philosophy, Washington, DC: The Catholic University of America Press.
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Other Internet Resources

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Acknowledgments

As of the 2026 update, Tobias Hoffmann has taken over responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry. Hoffmann thanks Francis Feingold for perceptive comments on a draft of the 2026 update.

Copyright © 2026 by
Tobias Hoffmann <tobias.hoffmann@sorbonne-universite.fr>
John Wippel

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