1. These included lectures on Aristotle, Plato, Aquinas, Descartes, Spinoza, Leibniz, Kant, and Dilthey.

2. See also Carman 2003: 17; Rouse 2005: 174; Sheehan 2001: 191; and Käufer 2005: 483: being is “the meaning-conditions that make entities as such intelligible”

3. Sheehan goes on to argue, however, that the true aim of Being and Time is an inquiry, not into being, but into what accounts for being.

4. See also GA24: 389: “being is understood and conceptually comprehended by means of time”. Heidegger intended to demonstrate this by showing that “all the propositions of ontology are Temporal propositions. Their truths unveil structures and possibilities of being in the light of Temporality” (GA24: 460). For more on the development of the project of Being and Time, and on the various unpublished drafts of this work, see Kisiel 1993 and 2015.

5. Heidegger later dubs this “the ontological difference”. The ontological difference makes possible a distinction between philosophy and the sciences, since philosophy inquires into ontology while the sciences inquire into the ontic properties and interactions between entities. Indeed, Heidegger argues that philosophy as a discipline distinct from the empirical sciences

stands and falls with the possibility of a sufficiently clear accomplishment of this differentiation between being and beings and accordingly with the possibility of negotiating the passage from the ontical consideration of beings to the ontological thematization of being. (GA24: 323)

But this does not mean that it is easy to tell what constitutes a genuinely ontological structure as opposed to an ontic feature of entities, and Heidegger believes that there has been a fatal tendency to treat being itself as an ontic property (see GA73.2: 1411). As Withy points out,

shortly after Being and Time, the ontological difference comes to seem deeply problematic to Heidegger. In his 1929/1930 lectures The Fundamental Concepts of Metaphysics, he says that “this distinction as a whole is in its essence a completely obscure distinction”. (Withy 2025: 31)

6. Heidegger’s distinction between the ontological and the ontic tracks the difference between being and entities. Something is “ontological” if it concerns the concepts and structures of being—for instance, “essence”, “existence”, the different kinds of being, or the disclosure of being. Something is “ontic”, by contrast, if it concerns a particular instantiation or concretion of these ontological structures.

7. One year after the publication of Being and Time, Heidegger offered the following partial list of kinds of being:

With respect to the different kinds of being of entities, we can distinguish—the existing: human beings; the living: plants and animals; the occurrent: material things; the available: use-objects in the broadest sense; the subsisting: number and space. (GA27: 71–72)

For discussions of life as a kind of being, see: GA25: 20; GA29/30: 277; GA38: 144; GA80.1: 70; SZ 10. For numbers as a kind of being, see: GA21: 382 ff.; GA24: 430; GA38: 144. For nature as a kind of being, see: SZ 70; GA34: 236.

8. I.e., “the being-character of the available” (SZ 84).

9. “The structure of the being of the available as equipment is determined by references” (SZ 74).

10. “Affordances are a function of, on the one hand, the projects, abilities, skills, and dispositions of the specific agent and, on the other hand, the possibilities furnished by the equipment the agent encounters when that equipment is situated in a whole context of equipment” (Wrathall 2021c: 31).

11. “The less we just stare at the hammer-thing, and the more we take it in hand in using it, the more primordial does our relationship to it become, and the more unveiledly is it encountered as that which it is—as equipment” (SZ 69).

12. “The sharpest merely-looking-at, directed at the ‘outward appearance’ of things in such and such a condition, is not capable of discovering what is available. The merely ‘theoretical’ view of thing, a view that looks-at, misses out on an understanding of availableness. But the coping that uses and handles [equipment] is not blind; it has its own kind of sight, which guides the handling and gives to it its specific security” (SZ 69).

13. See also SZ 87–8, where Heidegger responds to the objection that by defining the being of the available as an affordance within a context of references, he has “volitilized” “the ‘substantial being’ of entities within-the-world … into a system of relations”.

14. For instance, Heidegger notes that “the entities that surround us are uniformly manifest as that which is simply occurrent (das Vorhandene) in the broadest sense—the existing [Vorkommen] of land and sea, the mountains and forests, and in all of this the existing [Vorkommen] of animals and plants and of human beings and the products of human work, and at the same time the existing of we ourselves amongst all this” (GA29/30:399).

15. “materielle Dinge” (GA27: 71). See also GA20: 232–3, where Heidegger argues that the Cartesian notion of “substantiality”—of an entity that “is in need of no other entity”—“means occurrentness” (GA20: 232–3).

16. Heidegger describes this deficiency as “concern holding itself back”, a “holding-oneself-back from any manipulation or utilization” (SZ 61).

17. See Dreyfus 1991: 212 ff. Golob is critical of this claim. Golob 2014.

18. Heidegger notes, for example, that an available hammer, because defined by its affordances, can be “too heavy, too light, or just right”. But of an occurrent object

it makes no sense to say: too heavy, too light …. because now it does not stand in an equipmental context…. Its heaviness is not oriented toward handiness and unwieldiness, but rather is merely understood in the sense of gravitation. (GA23: 21)

But Heidegger never satisfactorily explains in detail how we are to understand the relationship between the available and the occurrent. As Cerbone notes:

What is needed here, but which Heidegger does not provide, is an account of how what is available and what is occurrent can coincide, but without being identical. They coincide in that they are in the same place at the same time, so that we do not look anywhere else to see one rather than another, but in seeing one rather than the other, we are seeing things whose identity conditions diverge. (Cerbone 2021: 540)

19. Thus, Haugeland argues, “chemistry is Dasein—and so are philately, Christmas, and Cincinnati”, but individual persons (like you and me) are not Dasein (Haugeland 2013: 9). Haugeland contends that it is a significant error to think “that each of us is or has one Dasein, and there is a Dasein for each of us” (Haugeland 2013: 10). Rather, we ought properly to say that each of us is “a case of Dasein” (Haugeland 2013: 10). In support of such claims, Haugeland argues that “Dasein is (virtually) never used as a count noun”, and thus can not refer to individual human beings like you and I (Haugeland 2013: 9).

20. A selective list of examples: “a Dasein can, should, and must become master of its moods” (SZ 136); “one Dasein can … within certain limits” represent another Dasein in their everyday activities and concerns (SZ 239); “a Dasein … can develop the different possibilities of sight” such as looking around or looking at an object (SZ 336); “a Dasein comports itself to extant things” like tables, chairs, and doors (GA24: 234); “one Dasein communicates by its utterances with another Dasein” and in doing so, “one Dasein enters with the other, the addressee, into the same being-relationship to that about which the assertion is made” (GA24: 299). It is simply wrong to say, as Haugeland does, that Dasein “is (virtually) never used as a count noun” (Haugeland 2013: 9).

21. In Being and Time, Heidegger notes that “When addressing Dasein, one must always include the personal pronoun: ‘I am’, ‘you are’” (SZ 42). And elsewhere he explicitly equates Dasein with human beings: “the word ‘Dasein’ is used for being-human [Mensch-sein]—for the entity of the type ‘human’” (GA82: 22; see also SZ 11).

22. As such, a Da-sein is something that “must be achieved” (GA82: 22), since it is not the case that all humans dwell in a locale (see supplement: Heidegger and the Other Beginning).

23. See SZ 143–4: “Possibility is the most primordial and the ultimate positive ontological determination of Dasein”. As Heidegger explains in Being and Time, “Dasein is in every case what it can be, and how it is its possibility” (SZ 134). “Dasein”, in other words, “is defined by its ability-to-choose” (GA64: 53–4).

24. “We cannot define the Dasein’s essence by citing a factual (sachhaltige) ‘what’…. Its essence lies rather in the fact that in each case it has its being to be as its own” (SZ 12).

25. “Fundamental ontology” is Heidegger’s label for an account of being that can establish the foundation—the fundament—for understanding every kind of being, and for understanding being as such: “we understand fundamental ontology to be the foundation of ontology in general” (GA26: 196). In the published sections of Being and Time, Heidegger pursues this fundamental account through in interpretation of human existence because Dasein is the being the understands being. As Mulhall points out, for Heidegger

an existential analytic of Dasein is not merely an essential preliminary to the task of fundamental ontology; rather, ‘the ontological analytic of Dasein in general is what makes up fundamental ontology (Mulhall 2013: 18, quoting SZ 14).

26. One chapter of Division 1 is devoted to each of these structural components. The world is the focus of chapter 3; the self is the focus of chapter 4; and the being-in relation is the focus of chapter 5.

27. See also Cerbone 2013: 129: “Descartes’ fundamental notion of material substance is a spatial-geometrical one, constituted by the idea of extension and its various modifications (motion, divisibility, and so on). Descartes ’ material world is fundamentally a world whose spatiality is articulable in precise geometrical terms, and whatever eludes or evades those terms is to be dismissed as in some way second-rate, subjective, or illusory, vestiges of our confused, prescientific take on things”.

28. Heidegger will revisit the question of selfhood when he takes up authentic modes of existence in Division II.

29. “We take pleasure and enjoy ourselves as anyone [man] takes pleasure; we read, see, and judge about literature and art as anyone sees and judges; likewise we shrink back from the ‘great mass’ as anyone shrinks back. We find ‘shocking’ what anyone finds shocking. The ‘anyone’, which is nothing definite, and which all are, though not as a sum, prescribes the kind of being of everydayness” (SZ 126–7).

30. “In everydayness, Dasein is not the being that I am; rather, the everydayness of Dasein is that being that the anyone is” (GA64: 120). As Heidegger puts it in Being and Time, in everydayness, “everyone is the other and no-one is himself. The ‘anyone’, which supplies the answer to the question of the ‘who’ of everyday Dasein, is the ‘nobody’ to whom every Dasein has already surrendered itself in being-among-one-other” (SZ 128).

31. The anyone “deprives Dasein of its choice, its formation of judgments, and its estimation of values; it relieves Dasein of the task, insofar as it lives in the anyone, to be itself by way of itself. The anyone takes Dasein’s ‘to-be’ away and allows all responsibility to be foisted onto itself” (GA20: 340).

32. Heidegger explains that the ‘in’ in ‘being-in’ “primarily does not signify anything spatial at all but means primarily being familiar with” (GA20: 213). “Being-in” is thus “defined as dwelling with…, being-familiar with…” (SZ 188). Dreyfus describes this familiarity well as a “holistic background coping … that makes possible appropriate dealings in particular circumstances” (Dreyfus 1991: 104).

33. “Ontologically mood is a primordial kind of Being for Dasein, in which Dasein is disclosed to itself prior to all cognition and volition, and beyond their range of disclosure” (SZ 136). The disclosure takes the form of immediately turning us toward some things and away from others (see SZ 136).

34. As Withy explains, “Because they are disclosive, moods or attunements should not be thought of as occurrent inside a subject, or as subjective colorings imposed on an objective, neutral world. Heidegger rarely discusses mood without scathingly dismissing all ‘psychology of feelings’” (Withy 2021a: 500).

35. As Heidegger explains, “the dominance of the public way in which things have been interpreted has already been decisive even for the possibilities of having a mood—that is, for the basic way in which Dasein lets the world ‘matter’ to it” (SZ 169).

36. Heidegger notes: “Dasein in concern, in every performance, in every provision and production of something in particular, is at the same time concerned for its Dasein” (GA20: 408). Along these lines, Sartre concludes that anxiety in the face of death “can be understood only on the foundation of an initial project to live, i.e., on the basis of an original choice of our being” (Sartre 1943 [2018: 733]).

37. See, e.g., SZ 222; GA24: 392. Consequently, “an entity which is understood is an entity that has been projected upon its possibility” (SZ 148).

38. Dreyfus argues, for instance, that understanding just is “know-how”:

To understand a hammer, for example, does not mean to know that hammers have such and such properties and that they are used for certain purposes…. Rather, understanding a hammer at its most primordial means knowing how to hammer. (Dreyfus 1991: 184)

Blattner likewise holds that “to understand something is to be able to do or manage or master it” (Blattner 2006: 85). And Carman defines understanding as “competence, skill, know-how” (Carman 2003: 19).

39. See, e.g., Dreyfus 1991: 195; Carman 2003: 1: “interpretation … means explicit understanding.”

40. Brandom, for instance, sees the task of interpretation as “classif[ying] according to personal ends or projects”—a step that makes inference and assertion possible (Brandom 2005: 224). Polt argues that “When we pursue a possibility intensively and use it to reveal beings further, we are interpreting” (Polt 1999: 69). Wrathall argues that,

interpretation is an activity that develops and enriches the understanding. As I pursue some definite set of possibilities that the world affords me—as I let myself be solicited by some possibility—that possibility will, for its part, demand of me that I develop myself to respond appropriately to it. The possibilities “exert a counter thrust” (SZ 148)—they rebound or push back at us, changing us and forcing us to adapt to them. (Wrathall 2021f: 426)

The understanding is in this way developed and enriched in an interpretation that appropriates the understanding, commits to it, and works out the possibilities projected in the understanding. In this way, interpretation enhances our familiarity with the world.

41. More generally, discourse is “the articulation of intelligibility” (SZ 161, SZ 271).

42. Speaking is a discursive phenomenon, but so is keeping silent (SZ 164–5). Hearing language is a discursive phenomenon, but so is “hearkening” to noises like motorcycles, the north wind, and the crackling of a fire (SZ 163). Even “hearing” another person need not be a linguistic activity—it can involve merely “following” and “going along” with what they are doing (SZ 163).

43. “[I]f Heidegger’s analysis built these markers of inauthenticity into Dasein’s ontological structure, there could no longer be a particular concrete state of Dasein that did not manifest them, and hence authentic existence would be inconceivable. In the context of our concerns in this book, that would amount to a conception of Dasein as not just commonly or even inveterately in flight from its own authentic fulfilment, but as inherently perverse or fallen beyond any conceivable redemption” (Mulhall 2005: 52–3).

44. “This everyday way in which things have been interpreted is one into which Dasein has grown in the first instance, with never a possibility of extrication. In it, out of it, and against it, all genuine understanding, interpreting, and communicating, all re-discovering and appropriating anew, are performed. In no case is a Dasein, untouched and unseduced by this way in which things have been interpreted, set before the open country of a ‘world-in-itself’ so that it just beholds what it encounters” (SZ 169–70).

45. See also Carman 2000: 20 ff.. See SZ 167–8: “in language, as a way things have been expressed, there is hidden a way in which the understanding of Dasein has been interpreted …. In the first instance, and with certain limits, Dasein is constantly delivered over to the interpretedness, which controls and distributes the possibilities of average understanding and of the disposedness belonging to it”.

46. The ultimate aim here is ontological rather than ethical: “If the interpretation of Dasein’s being is supposed to become the foundation for working out the basic question of ontology”, Heidegger notes, then it needs to be able to account for every aspect of Dasein’s being and not just its inauthentic and everyday modes (SZ 233).

47. See Blattner 2013 for an illuminating discussion of these differences. See also Golob 2025.

48. See SZ 247; Wrathall & Murphy 2013: 23; Blattner 1994: 54; Carman 2003: 279.

49. Heidegger explains that “the anyone concerns itself with transforming anxiety [in the face of death] into fear in the face of an oncoming event [i.e., demise]” (SZ 254).

50. See also P. Edwards 1976: 182; Sartre 1943 [2018: 709].

51. Thomson argues, for instance, that death is the “stark and desolate phenomenon in which we find ourselves (at least momentarily) unable to project ourselves into any of the existential projects that ordinarily bestow our lives with meaning” (Thomson 2021: 217).

52. To put it simply, the distinction amounts to this: “demise [is] an event that occurs” (vorkommende Ereignis); it is a “case of death” (Todesfall). Death, by contrast, is a peculiar type of possibility—namely, the finite limitation of all other possibilities. When “death is spoken of as a ‘case’ which is constantly occurring”—that is, when death is regarded as an event or a process,—then “death gets passed off as always something ‘actual’” and “its character as a possibility gets concealed” (SZ 253). Heidegger repeatedly insists that the ontological structure formally indicated by the word “death” is not an event or process. See SZ 250, 253, 257; GA20: 432; GA80.1: 141–2; GA64: 142; GA64: 58; GA62: 358; Wrathall 2025.

53. “Anxiety … as a basic disposedness of Dasein, is the disclosedness of the fact that Dasein exists as thrown being towards its end” (SZ 251). Leaving aside the debate over the merits of EDI as an interpretation of Heidegger’s account of death, it offers an extremely trenchant account of Heideggerian anxiety. By depriving one of the ability to interpret oneself in terms of the norms, activities, and objects of concern that characterize everyday existence, anxiety in its fullest manifestations involves precisely the type of collapse of identity or self-understanding that EDI describes as “living through death”. And it is precisely in such experiences that death “reveals itself to Dasein” and does so “in a more original and forceful manner in the disposedness of anxiety” than it does in “theoretical knowledge” (SZ 251). It does this by “hold[ing] open the constant and absolute threat to one’s self…. In anxiety, Dasein finds itself (befindet sich) before the nothingness of the possible impossibility of its existence” (SZ 265–66).

54. Or, as Blattner puts it, “I am not free to be anyone I would like to be because I am already someone determinate” (Blattner 2015: 118). This “being already someone” Blattner notes, “limits and structures who it is able to be going forward” (Blattner 2013: 330).

55. As Heidegger notes, “because Dasein is lost in the anyone, it must first find itself. In order to find itself at all, it must be ‘shown’ to itself in its possible authenticity” (SZ 268).

56. In wanting to have a conscience, Dasein acts in the recognition that appeals to norms or conventions “can neither vindicate [my] action nor discharge [my] responsibility for the nullity I cause in the being of others” (Wrathall & Murphy 2013: 30).

57. “The anticipation of death alone drives out every accidental and ‘provisional’ possibility. Only being-free for death gives Dasein its ultimate goal and thrusts existence into its finitude. Once one has grasped the finitude of one’s existence, it tears one back from the endless multiplicity of possibilities that offer themselves as closest to one—those of comfortableness, taking things lightly, and shirking—and brings Dasein into the simplicity of its fate” (SZ 384).

58. In resoluteness, “being-guilty is understood as something constant” (SZ 305).

59. “But the phenomenon of the authentic ability-to-be also opens our eyes for the constancy of the self in the sense of having achieved a stand. The constancy of the self, in the double sense of the continuous steadfastness [literally, stability-of-a stand, Standfestigkeit] is the authentic counter-possibility to the non-self-constancy of irresolute falling. ‘Self-constancy’ signifies existentially nothing other than anticipatory resoluteness. The ontological structure of anticipatory resoluteness reveals the existentiality of the selfhood of the self” (SZ 322).

60. Heidegger’s account bears clear affinities to Husserl’s important work on time consciousness (see Husserl 1928/1964), but there is some dispute over the exact character and directness of Husserl’s influence (see Dahlstrom 2001: 164ff., and Blattner 1999: 198ff.).

61. See also GA24: 388: “Insofar as it functions as a condition of the possibility of both the pre-ontological and the ontological understanding of being, we call temporality (Zeitlichkeit) ‘Temporality’ (Temporalität)”.

62. See SZ 201–2. In section 44 of Being and Time, Heidegger treats ‘reality’ as synonymous with ‘occurrentness’, that thus distinguishes between reality as a kind of being, and the real as a designation for entities that have reality. See SZ 208–9.

63. “Being” is defined as “that which determines entities as entities” (SZ 6).

64. “Being ‘is’ only in the understanding of those entities to whose being something like an understanding of being belongs” (SZ 183).

65. See also SZ 211–2: “The fact that reality is ontologically grounded in the being of Dasein, does not signify that only when Dasein exists and as long as Dasein exists, can the real be as that which in itself it is…. As we have noted, being (not entities) is dependent upon the understanding of being; that is to say, reality (not the real) is dependent upon care”.

66. “From its beginning…. the essence of truth as alētheia was not thought out in the thinking of the Greeks, and certainly not in the philosophy that followed after. Unconcealment is, for thought, the most concealed thing in Greek existence” (GA5: 37 / OTBT 28 / PLT 49–50).

67. See Withy 2022: 127. For more on Heidegger’s account of the different types of unconcealment, see Wrathall 2011, Withy 2017, and Dahlstrom 2001.

68. “Truth has by no means the structure of a correspondence between knowing and object in the sense of a matching of one entity (the subject) to another (the object)” (SZ 218–9).

69. See also “The Inner Possibility of Correspondence”, GA9: 182ff.

70. See, for example, his discussion of Newton’s Laws at GA24: 315/220: “Newton's laws, which are often used in arguments having to do with the interpretation of truth, have not existed from all eternity, and they were not true before they were discovered by Newton. They became true only in and with their uncoveredness, because this uncoveredness is their truth”.

71. The 1927 lecture course on The Basic Problems of Phenomenology (GA24) does, however, provide some indications of what this account would have looked like.

72. A draft of Division Three had in fact been completed, and page proofs printed, when Heidegger was preparing Being and Time for publication in 1926. See Herrmann 1991: 16–19. But Heidegger explained later that “the decision to abort the publication” of Division Three was reached in January 1927 following “lively but friendly disputes” with Karl Jaspers (GA49: 39–40). The discussion with Jaspers convinced Heidegger that the argument of Division Three as he had elaborated it to that point was “unintelligible” (GA49: 40). Thus, when Being and Time was published in late April 1927, it contained only the first two Divisions of Part One (see Kisiel 1993: 486). “I was at the time absolutely of the opinion”, Heidegger noted later, “that everything could be said more clearly over the course of the [coming] year” (GA49: 40). Accordingly, starting in May 1927, Heidegger offered lectures on the Basic Problems of Phenomenology, which he described as “a new working out of Division 3 of Part One of Being and Time” (GA24: 1 n.1). This was the division in Being and Time which, according to the original design of the treatise, was supposed to have the big pay off: an account of the sense of being in general in terms of time. However, this lecture course was itself incomplete—Heidegger presented only five out of a promised twelve chapters. For a more detailed account of Heidegger’s changing approaches to completing the project, see Kisiel 2015.

73. See Lambeth 2023; Gordon 2010; Käufer 2011; Dahlstrom 1991; Dahlstrom 1994; de Boer & Howard 2019.

74. In 1932, Heidegger describes the published portion of Being and Time as a “path” that “once for me led somewhere”. But the path had been abandoned and was now “overgrown” (EB 54).

75. “The question arose”, Heidegger observed, “whether time as the horizon of the projection of presence is determined by and through the temporality of Da-sein, or whether conversely the temporality of Da-sein receives its determination from ‘time’ qua projection-domain of presence” (GA82: 402; see also GA82: 304–5, GA14: 19 / OTB 14–5). In another retrospective note, Heidegger indicates that the transcendental grounding of time in Dasein’s understanding was a mistake: “In Being and Time, the question of being is against its will actually and merely a question of the understanding of being—a question concerning the possibility and horizon of the understanding of being. Why did it drift off course thither!” (GA82: 183).

76. “The ecstatic-horizonal temporality identified in Being and Time is by no means the most proper attribute of time that is sought after as relevant to the being-question” (GA11: 147 / XII).

77. See also GA14: 22 / OTB 16–17: “time [is] the domain of the lasting of the clearing of a manifold presencing” of being in its “epochal transformations”.

78. Heidegger argues, for instance, that “to think the history of Western metaphysics” we need to think through “that in which every act and every reality of that age of Western history have their time and their space, their ground and their background, their methods and goals, their order and their justification, their certainty and instability—in a word, have their ‘truth’” (GA48: 11–12; GA6.2: 32–33 / N4 10–11).

79. See, e.g.,“The Age of the World Picture” and “Science and Reflection” (GA5), and The Question Concerning the Thing. (GA41), and “The Question Concerning Technology” (GA7: 5–36 / QCT 3–35).

80. As Richardson notes, Heidegger believes that “[e]ach epoch’s understanding of being is articulated in the words and ideas of … metaphysicians…. So by studying the series of these metaphysical vocabularies and systems, we get at the single main stream of our history” (J. Richardson 2012: 213).

81. In what van Inwagen, Sullivan, and Bernstein dub “the ‘new’ metaphysics”, these categories include modality, space and time, persistence and constitution, causation, freedom and determinism, the mental and physical. See van Inwagen, Sullivan, and Bernstein 2023.

82. This is even true in the case of Nietzsche, whose work is explicitly opposed to metaphysics understood as a branch of academic philosophy. See, e.g., GA77: 188.

83. See GA48: 208: “Each metaphysic contains a historical decision ‘about’ the relationship of human beings to entities as such and as a whole. A metaphysic is in each case a deciding of this relationship, indeed, it is this relationship itself as a decision. A particular doctrinal presentation of the metaphysic is not the metaphysic itself, but rather the derived way of communicating it”.

84. In his later work, Heidegger contrasts this metaphysical account of being with his own view that being is dynamic and, as such, responsible for epochal transformations in our human understanding of ourselves and the entities around us. To distinguish his dynamic account of being from a static view, Heidegger sometimes adopts the archaic spelling: ‘beyng’ (Seyn). This spelling “is supposed to indicate that being is here no longer being thought metaphysically” (GA65: 436). But Heidegger does not always use this convention, and one often has to discern from context whether Heidegger is using ‘being’ in the static-and-metaphysical or the dynamic-post-metaphysical sense.

85. See also GA98: 143: “The basic principle of every metaphysic”, Heidegger explains elsewhere, “is the positing of that [characteristic] as which what presences is represented”.

86. See, e.g., GA66: 24: “inquiry into the truth [i.e., unconcealment] of beyng” “is denied to each metaphysic”; or GA96: 23: “the essential foundation of every metaphysic” is leaving the question of the truth of being unasked.

87. In his essay on Anaximander, Heidegger lists four distinct metaphysical ages; these are: “the [philosophical] Greek, Christendom, modernity, the planetary” (GA5: 336 / EGT 25–6). In other writings, Heidegger places a fifth epoch into the middle of the sequence—namely, the Roman world.

88. See GA5: 209. In the technological age, it is no longer just the history of the West that is at stake. The technological understanding of being is so effective at maximizing control that it enjoys “planetary dominance” (GA7: 73 / EP 90).

89. “In the uncanniness of the modern technological world”, Heidegger explains, “it is the barely noticed fundamental attunement of profound boredom that drives us into all the diversions” made available by the technological world. These diversions are needed because “nothing appeals to us anymore” while “at the same time we are looking for that which speaks to us in a way that lays claim to us completely, in such a way that time never remains empty, and no diversions are needed” (GA16: 579–80).

90. For more on Nietzsche as the thinker of the technological age, see Thomson 2005: 44.

91. Technology, as Heidegger puts it, discloses entities as amenable to “planning, calculation, arranging, breeding”, and it “makes demands on the entities that have come into its power in this way … , not with the intention of making progress toward a goal and ‘ideal’, but rather for the sake of becoming itself” (GA66: 26).

92. See Dreyfus 2017: 190ff.; see also Thomson 2005: 62.

93. “With Nietzsche’s metaphysics, philosophy is complete. That is to say, philosophy has paced off the perimeter of prefigured possibilities. The completed metaphysics, which is the basis of the planetary way of thinking, provides the framework for an ordering of the earth that will presumably be long-lasting” (GA7: 81).

94. Technology’s capacity for incorporating any new good is a function of its fundamental aimlessness. Since there is no goal that technology strives to achieve, no activity is out of place. “The aimlessness”, Heidegger explains, “is not a defect, but rather the virtue that ensures the unconditional calculation and its constant over-enhancement” (GA73.1: 66).

95. “Conserving does not itself consist only in the fact that we do not harm that which is conserved. Authentic conserving is something positive and takes place when we leave something beforehand in its own essence, when we specifically bring something back into its essence, when we free it in the proper sense of bringing it into a peaceful open place. To dwell, to be brought to peace, means to remain at peace within … the free sphere that conserves everything in its essence. The fundamental character of dwelling is this conserving” (GA7: 150 / PLT 147).

96. A poetic dwelling consists in “the way [mortals] preserve the fourfold in its essence” (GA7: 152 / PLT 148). For a richly detailed and careful study of the emergence of Heidegger’s account of the fourfold from his engagement with Hölderlin, see Mattéi 2001.

97. Die Göttlichen—more literally, “the god-like ones”.

98. See also GA21: 151: “Only insofar as intelligibility—signification—already belongs to Dasein can it express itself phonetically in such a way that these spoken statements are words that now have something like signification. Because Dasein in its very being is itself signifying, it lives in significations and can express itself as significations. And only because there are such spoken statements—that is, words—accruing to the signification, can there be isolable words; i.e., only now can linguistic forms, which themselves are shaped by the meaning, be detachable from that meaning. Such a totality of utterances, in which the understanding of a Dasein in a certain sense arises and is existentially, we call ‘language’”.

99. In defense of reading “language” in the later Heidegger as language in “the standard sense”, Golob points to Heidegger’s reference to Indo-Germanic languages in GA19: 253. In that passage, Golob notes, Heidegger “does indeed seem to be talking about ‘language’ in the ordinary sense of that term” (Golob 2014: 64 n. 34). But GA19 long precedes Heidegger’s transition to thinking of language as a world-forming power.

100. See also GA9: 72: “Language is not a work of human beings: language speaks. Humans only speak insofar as they co-respond to language”; compare GA10: 143, GA12: 28 / PLT 205; GA12: 244 / OWL 124; GA13: 147; GA79: 168–9; GA80.2: 128.

101. “True poetry is the language of being, which has long been spoken to us and that we have never yet caught up with”. (GA38A: 167)

102. “The people of this earth are challenged by the unconditional dominance of the essence of modern technology, together with technology itself, to order the whole of the world into a uniform condition, secured by a final world-formula, and for that reason available as a calculable resource. The challenge that provokes us to such making-available orders everything into a single design” (GA4: 178).

103. See also Wrathall & Lambeth 2011: 180:

Though the ancient Greeks were responsive to the entities around them, something apparent in their ability to shift attunements in response to a multiplicity of gods, they did not really conceive of themselves as playing a part in a process of mutual attuning. Things would whoosh up before them, and this could strike them as terrifying or awe-inspiring. They experienced certain things as happening to them, gods and entities as coming upon them, but they did not see themselves as taking part in the process of world disclosure.

In the other beginning, by contrast, Heidegger envisions human beings as themselves adapted to their role as receivers of being.

What adaptation adapts (Ereignis ereignet)—and that means, what adaptation brings into its own and maintains in adaptation—,

Heidegger explains, is

the belonging together of being and human beings. In this belonging together, those that belong together are no longer being and human being, but rather—as adapted—mortals in the fourfold of the world. (GA10: 51)

104. See also GA9: 368 / P 279: “If our thinking should succeed in its efforts to go back into the ground of metaphysics”, Heidegger observes in 1949, “it might well help to bring about a change in the human essence, a change accompanied by a transformation of metaphysics”.

105. See GA5: 111 / OTBT 84. See also GA48: 213:

Man therefore does not become a subject by withdrawing into himself and isolating himself from the world, but rather by discovering the world, conquering the world, researching the world, dominating the world, ruling the world in an ever more pure and unconditional way.

One can detect in this passage from the late 1930s and early 1940s Heidegger’s growing disillusionment with the ethno-nationalist politics of the National Socialists.

106. See also GA100: 283: “the pure abandonment of metaphysics” only happens, Heidegger claims, “from the simple dwelling in the fourfold, as conditioned by things” (einfach be-dingten Wohnen im Geviert.)

107. Malpas asks:

Yet what is the “home”, in German the “Heimat,” to which we are supposed to return? Is it, to take a handful of possibilities, Heidegger’s Black Forest, Wordsworth’s Lake District, John Clare’s native Northamptonshire, or central Australia as articulated in Pinjarra Aboriginal Dreaming? Is it to the juxtaposition of bush, hill, and sea that is so characteristic of the New Zealand North Island countryside (and of some parts of Tasmania), to the mountainous, sky-filled landscape of the Himalayas, the rocky desert country of North Africa, or the open prairie of the American West? Is it the “home” of some premodern agrarian existence, or could it possibly be found in the contemporary urban life of cities such as New York, Beijing or Sydney? In fact, the home that Heidegger is concerned with, in spite of his preference for imagery drawn from his own German life and experience, is none of these, and yet it could also be found in all or any one of them. (Malpas 2006: 309)

108. “Dwelling is accomplished”, Heidegger explains, “in such a way that it conserves the world into things…. Conserving the world into things requires things that grant to the inhabited world and thus to dwelling a place to stay” (GA80.2: 1077).

109. “Like Heidegger, deep ecologists criticize the metaphysical presuppositions allegedly responsible for ecological destruction, and also contend that a transformed awareness of what humanity and nature ‘are’ would lead spontaneously to a transformation of society. The solution to the environmental crisis, then, would involve an ontological shift: from an anthropocentric, dualistic, and utilitarian understanding of nature to an understanding which ‘lets things be’, i.e., which discloses things other than merely as raw material for human ends. A nonanthropocentric humanity, having undergone what amounts to a spiritual transformation, would presumably develop attitudes, practices, and institutions that would exhibit respect and care for all beings” (Zimmerman 1993: 196).

110. A poetic dwelling consists in “the way [mortals] preserve the fourfold in its essence” (GA7: 152 / PLT 148).

111. “[E]arth and sky, divinities and mortals, united to each other of their own accord, belong together by way of the simpleness of the united fourfold. Each of the four reflects in its own way the essence of the others. At the same time, each in its own way is reflected back into its own, within the simple onefold of the four…. None of the four insists on its own separate particularity”. (GA7: 171 / PLT 179).