1. The Royal Prussian Academy of Sciences (Königlich Preussische Academie der Wissenschaften or Académie Royale des Sciences et des Belles-Lettres of Berlin) had annual essay contests starting in 1744. This one was issued in 1769 and the prize awarded in 1771 to Johann Gottfried Herder (see entry).

2. From article 2 of the regulations issued in 1866:

La Société n’admet aucune communication concernant, soit l’origine du langage soit la création d’une langue universelle.

The Society does not accept any communication concerning either the origin of language or the creation of a universal language.