Ontological Arguments

First published Thu Feb 8, 1996; substantive revision Mon Jun 3, 2024

Ontological arguments are arguments, for the conclusion that God exists, from premises which are supposed to derive from some source other than observation of the world—e.g., from reason alone. In other words, ontological arguments are arguments from what are typically alleged to be none but analytic, a priori and necessary premises to the conclusion that God exists.

The first, and best-known, ontological argument was proposed by Anselm of Canterbury in the eleventh century CE. In his Proslogion, Anselm claims to derive the existence of that than which no greater can be conceived from the concept of that than which no greater can be conceived. Anselm reasoned that, if such a being fails to exist, then a greater being—namely, a being than which no greater can be conceived, and which exists—can be conceived. But this would be absurd: nothing can be greater than a being than which no greater can be conceived. So a being than which no greater can be conceived exists. And, very plausibly, if that than which no greater can be conceived exists, then it is God and so God exists.

In the seventeenth century, René Descartes defended a family of similar arguments. For instance, in the Fifth Meditation, Descartes claims to provide a proof demonstrating the existence of a supremely perfect being from the idea of a supremely perfect being. Descartes argues that there is no less contradiction in conceiving a supremely perfect being who lacks existence than there is in conceiving a triangle whose interior angles do not sum to 180 degrees. Hence, he supposes, since we do conceive a supremely perfect being—we do have the idea of a supremely perfect being—we must conclude that a supremely perfect being exists. And, very plausibly, if a supremely perfect being exists, then God exists.

In the early eighteenth century, Gottfried Leibniz attempted to fill what he took to be a shortcoming in Descartes’ view. According to Leibniz, Descartes’ arguments fail unless one first shows that the idea of a supremely perfect being is coherent, or that it is possible for there to be a supremely perfect being. Leibniz argued that, since perfections are unanalyzable, it is impossible to demonstrate that perfections are incompatible—and he concluded from this that all perfections can co-exist together in a single entity.

In more recent times, Kurt Gödel, Charles Hartshorne, Norman Malcolm, and Alvin Plantinga have all presented much-discussed ontological arguments which bear interesting connections to the earlier arguments of Anselm, Descartes, and Leibniz. Of these, the most interesting are those of Gödel and Plantinga; in these cases, however, it is unclear whether we should really say that these authors claim that the arguments are proofs of the existence of God.

Critiques of ontological arguments begin with Gaunilo, a contemporary of Anselm. Perhaps the best known criticisms of ontological arguments are due to Immanuel Kant, in his Critique of Pure Reason. Most famously, Kant claims that ontological arguments are vitiated by their reliance upon the implicit assumption that “existence” is a real predicate. However, as Bertrand Russell (1946: 568) observed, it is much easier to be persuaded that ontological arguments are no good than it is to say exactly what is wrong with them. This helps to explain why ontological arguments have fascinated philosophers for almost a thousand years.

1. Timeline

1078
Anselm of Canterbury, Proslogion. Followed soon after by Gaunilo’s critique On Behalf of the Fool.
1264
Thomas Aquinas, Summa. Criticises an argument which somehow descends from Anselm.
1637
Descartes, Discourse on Method. The argument of Discourse 4 is further elaborated in the Meditations. The Objections—particularly those of Caterus and Gassendi—and the Replies contain much valuable discussion of the Cartesian arguments.
c1680
Spinoza, Ethics. Intimations of a potentially defensible ontological argument, albeit one whose conclusion is not (obviously) endowed with religious significance.
1709
Leibniz, New Essays Concerning Human Understanding. Contains Leibniz’s attempt to complete the Cartesian argument by showing that the Cartesian conception of God is not inconsistent.
1776
Hume, Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion. Part IX is a general attack on a priori arguments (both analytic and synthetic). Includes a purported demonstration that no such arguments can be any good.
1787
Kant, Critique of Pure Reason. Contains much discussed attacks on traditional theistic arguments. Three objections to “the ontological argument”, including the famous objection based on the dictum that existence is not a predicate.
1831
Hegel, Lectures of 1831. In these lectures, Hegel says that “the ontological argument” succeeds. However, he does not make it clear what he takes the premises of “the ontological argument” to be; and nor does he make it clear what it would be for “the ontological argument” to succeed. Some scholars have claimed that the entire Hegelian corpus constitutes an ontological argument.
1884
Frege, Foundations of Arithmetic. Existence is a second-order predicate. First-order existence claims are meaningless. So ontological arguments—whose conclusions are first-order existence claims—are doomed.
1941
Hartshorne, Man’s Vision of God. Defence of modal ontological arguments, allegedly derived from Proslogion 3.
1970
Lewis, “Anselm and Actuality”. Critique of ontological arguments. All ontological arguments are either invalid or question-begging; moreover, in many cases, they have two closely related readings, one of which falls into each of the above categories.
Godel, “Ontological Proof”. Presentation of a higher-order modal ontological argument, inspired by the argument that Leibniz devised in the early eighteenth century, with the conclusion that God exists. Published in his Collected Works (1995).
1974
Plantinga, The Nature of Necessity. Plantinga’s “victorious” modal Ontological argument.

For a useful discussion of the history of ontological arguments in the modern period, see Harrelson 2009. For recent attempts to defend one or more ontological arguments, see Dombrowski 2006, Lowe 2007, Matthews & Baker 2010, Nagasawa 2017, Campbell 2018, and Leftow 2022. For detailed critical discussion of ontological arguments, see Sobel 2004 and Oppy 1996.

2. Taxonomy

According to a modification of the taxonomy of Oppy 1995, there are six major kinds of ontological arguments, viz:

  1. Definitional ontological arguments;
  2. Conceptual (or hyperintensional) ontological arguments;
  3. Modal ontological arguments;
  4. Meinongian ontological arguments;
  5. Higher-order ontological arguments; and
  6. ‘Hegelian’ ontological arguments.

Examples of all but the last follow. These are mostly toy examples, but they serve to highlight features of more complex ontological arguments.

First, a (toy) definitional ontological argument:

  1. God is a being which has every perfection. (Premise, true by definition.)
  2. Existence is a perfection. (Premise)
  3. Hence God exists. (From i, ii)

Second, a (toy) conceptual ontological argument:

  1. I conceive of a being than which no greater can be conceived. (Premise)
  2. If a being than which no greater can be conceived does not exist, then I can conceive of a being greater than a being than which no greater can be conceived—namely, a being than which no greater can be conceived that exists. (Premise)
  3. I cannot conceive of a being greater than a being than which no greater can be conceived. (Premise)
  4. Hence, a being than which no greater can be conceived exists. (From i, ii, and iii)

Third, a (toy) modal ontological argument:

  1. It is possible that God exists. (Premise)
  2. God is not a contingent being, i.e., either it is not possible that God exists, or it is necessary that God exists. (Premise)
  3. Hence, it is necessary that God exists. (From i and ii)
  4. Hence, God exists. (From iii. See Malcolm 1960, Hartshorne 1965, and Plantinga 1974 for closely related arguments.)

Fourth, a (toy) Meinongian ontological argument:

  1. [It is analytic, necessary and a priori that] Each instance of the schema “The F G is F” expresses a truth. (Premise)
  2. Hence the sentence “The existent perfect being is existent” expresses a truth. (From i)
  3. Hence, the existent perfect being is existent. (From ii)
  4. Hence, God is existent, i.e., God exists. (From iii. The last step is justified by the observation that, as a matter of definition, if there is exactly one existent perfect being, then that being is God.)

Fifth, a (toy) higher-order ontological argument:

  1. A God-property is a property that is possessed by God in all and only those worlds in which God exists. (Definition)
  2. Not all properties are God properties. (Premise)
  3. Any property entailed by a collection of God-properties is itself a God-property. (Premise)
  4. The God-properties include necessary existence, necessary omnipotence, necessary omniscience, and necessary perfect goodness. (Premise)
  5. Hence, there is a necessarily existent, necessarily omnipotent, necessarily omniscient, and necessarily perfectly good being (namely, God). (From i–iv.)

Of course, this taxonomy is not exclusive: an argument can belong to several categories at once. Moreover, an argument can be ambiguous between a range of readings, each of which belongs to different categories. This latter fact may help to explain part of the curious fascination of ontological arguments. Finally, the taxonomy can be further specialised: there are, for example, at least four importantly different kinds of modal ontological arguments which should be distinguished. (See, e.g., Ross 1969 for a rather different kind of modal ontological argument.)

Other (in our view minor) categories of ontological arguments that might be added to this taxonomy include:

  1. mereological (or Spinozistic) ontological arguments and
  2. experiential ontological arguments.

The former category might be exemplified in something like the following (toy) argument:

  1. I exist.
  2. Therefore something exists.
  3. Whenever a bunch of things exist, their mereological sum also exists.
  4. Therefore the sum of all things exists.
  5. Therefore God—the sum of all things—exists.

And the latter might be exemplified in the following (toy) argument (and see Rescher 1959):

  1. The word ‘God’ has a meaning that is revealed in religious experience. (Premise)
  2. The word ‘God’ has a meaning only if God exists. (Premise)
  3. Hence, God exists.

3. Characterisation

It is not easy to give a good characterisation of ontological arguments. The traditional characterisation involves the use of controversial notions—analyticity, necessity, and a priority—and also fails to apply to many arguments to which defenders have affixed the label “ontological”. (Consider, for example, the claim that I conceive of a being than which no greater can be conceived. This claim is clearly not analytic (its truth doesn’t follow immediately from the meanings of the words used to express it), nor necessary (I might never have entertained the concept), nor a priori (except perhaps in my own case, though even this is unclear—perhaps even I don’t know independently of experience that I have this concept.)) However, it is unclear how that traditional characterisation should be improved upon.

Perhaps one might resolve to use the label “ontological argument” for any argument which gets classified as “an ontological argument” by its proponent(s). This procedure would make good sense if one thought that there is a natural kind—ontological arguments—which our practice carves out, but for which it is hard to specify defining conditions. Moreover, this procedure can be adapted as a pro tem stop gap: when there is a better definition to hand, that definition will be adopted instead. On the other hand, it seems worthwhile to attempt a more informative definition.

Focus on the case of ontological arguments for the conclusion that God exists. One characteristic feature of these arguments is the use which they make of “referential vocabulary”—names, definite descriptions, indefinite descriptions, quantified noun phrases, etc.—whose ontological commitments—for occurrences of this vocabulary in “referential position”—non-theists do not accept.

Theists and non-theists alike (can) agree that there is spatio-temporal, or causal, or nomic, or modal structure to the world (the basis for cosmological arguments); and that there are certain kinds of complexity of organisation, structure and function in the world (the basis for teleological arguments); and so on. But theists and non-theists are in dispute about whether there are perfect beings, or beings than which no greater can be conceived, or …; thus, theists and non-theists are in dispute about the indirect subject matter of the premises of ontological arguments.

Of course, the premises of ontological arguments often do not deal directly with perfect beings, beings than which no greater can be conceived, etc.; rather, they deal with descriptions of, or ideas of, or concepts of, or the possibility of the existence of, these things. However, the basic point remains: ontological arguments require the use of vocabulary which non-theists should certainly find problematic when it is used in ontologically committing contexts.

Note that this characterisation does not beg the question against the possibility of the construction of a successful ontological argument—i.e., it does not lead immediately to the conclusion that all ontological arguments are question-begging (in virtue of the ontologically committing vocabulary which they employ). For it may be that the vocabulary in question only gets used in premises in ways that carry no ontological commitment. Of course, there will then be questions about whether the resulting arguments can possibly be valid—how could the commitments turn up in the conclusion if they are not there in the premises?—but those are further questions, which would remain to be addressed.

4. Uses and Goals

Before we turn to assessment of ontological arguments, we need to get clear about what the proper intended goals of ontological arguments can be. Suppose we think of arguments as having advocates and targets: when an advocate presents an argument to a target, the goal of the advocate is to bring about some change in the target. What might be the targets of ontological arguments, and what might be the changes that advocates of these arguments aim to bring about in those targets?

Here are some proposals; no doubt the reader can think of others:

  • The targets might be atheists, and the goal might be to turn them into theists.
  • The targets might be agnostics, and the goal might be to turn them into theists.
  • The targets might be theists, and the goal might be to improve the doxastic position of theists.
  • The targets might be professional philosophers, and the goal might be to advance understanding of the consequences of adopting particular logical rules, or treating existence as a real predicate, or allowing definitions to have existential import, or the like.
  • The targets might be undergraduate philosophy students, and the goal might be to give them some sufficiently frustrating examples on which to cut their critical teeth.

In the coming discussion, it will be supposed that the targets are atheists and agnostics, and that the goal is to turn them into theists. Suppose that an advocate presents an ontological argument to a target. What conditions must that argument satisfy if it is fit for its intended purpose? A plausible suggestion is that, minimally, it should make the targets recognise that they have good reason to accept the conclusion of the argument that they did not recognise that they have prior to the presentation of the argument. Adopting this plausible suggestion provides the following criterion: a successful ontological argument is one that should make atheists and agnostics recognise that they have good reason to believe that God exists that they did not recognise that they have prior to the presentation of the argument. Note that this criterion has a normative dimension: it adverts to what atheists and agnostics should do when presented with the argument.

There is an important discussion to be had about whether we should suppose that the targets of ontological arguments are atheists and agnostics and that the goal is to turn them into theists. It is simply beyond the scope of this entry to fully pursue that discussion here. We conclude this section by mentioning just one straw in the wind.

Towards the end of his presentation of his modal ontological argument, Plantinga writes:

Our verdict on these reformulated versions of St. Anselm’s argument must be as follows. They cannot, perhaps, be said to prove or establish their conclusion. But since it is rational to accept their central premise, they do show that it is rational to accept that conclusion. (1974: 221)

Here, it seems, Plantinga is supposing that the targets of ontological arguments are those who think that it is not rationally permissible to believe in God. Moreover, it seems reasonable to think that his ambition is to bring them to think that it is rationally permissible to believe in God. But the difficulty here is that the reasons that we have for supposing that his arguments are insufficient to bring atheist and agnostics to belief in God carry over quite straightforwardly to reasons for supposing that his arguments are insufficient to bring those who think that it is not rationally permissible to believe in God to belief that it is rationally permissible to believe in God. Atheists think that at least one premise in his argument is false. Agnostics are undecided about at least one premise in his argument. And those who think that it is not rationally permissible to believe in God think that there is at least one premise in his argument in which it is not rationally permissible to believe.

Perhaps it might be objected that Plantinga supposes, instead, that the targets of ontological arguments are theists. However—setting aside the point that it is not at all clear what such arguments could do for theists—it is unclear why Plantinga supposes that the status of the claim that it is rationally permissible to believe that God exists is importantly different from the status of the claim that God exists for theists. After all, theists for whom Plantinga thinks that the argument might do some useful work believe all of the premises and believe that all of the premises are such that it is rationally permissible to believe them. What could be the source of the asymmetry which brings it about that, while the argument fails to show to these theists that God exists, it succeeds in showing to these theists that it is rationally permissible to believe in God?

For discussion of Plantinga’s argument, see Section 8 below.

5. Descartes

Descartes presents what have come to be called ‘Cartesian ontological arguments’ in various places: Meditation V, many of the Replies (including the First (Caterus), the Second (mostly Mersenne), and the Fifth (Gassendi)), Discourse IV, and Principles XIV. Although there is little that is uncontroversial in the discussion of Cartesian ontological arguments, even the most casual reading of the texts reveals that the following argument has some relevance:

  1. God has every perfection.
  2. Independent existence is a perfection.
  3. (So) God exists.

While it is now quite common to claim that Descartes was not advancing any argument in favour of the existence of God in the texts in question—see, for example, the entry on Descartes’ ontological argument—it is clear that, insofar as there is a valid argument for the existence of God that is properly associated with the Cartesian texts, it is something like the argument just given.

A natural objection to this argument is that the conclusion follows trivially from the first premise alone. While the argument is valid—albeit possessed of a redundant premise—it is obvious that it can play no role in persuading informed atheists and agnostics to change their views. After all, informed atheists deny that God has every perfection on the ground that God does not exist, i.e., on the ground that there is no God that has so much as one perfection, let alone all of them. Equally, informed agnostics do not accept that God has every perfection by dint of not accepting that God exists, i.e., by dint of not accepting that there is a God that has so much as one perfection, let alone all of them.

One response to this objection is to reject the claim that it follows from the non-existence of God that there are no true sentences of the form ‘God has [such and such perfection]’. To go this way is to suppose that there are non-existent beings that nonetheless can be truly claimed to have properties. That is the way of Meinong. We shall return to consider it below.

Another response to this objection is to claim that the first premise really doesn’t do justice to the argument that is properly associated with the Cartesian texts. On this kind of view, the argument is better represented like this:

  1. By definition, God has every perfection
  2. Independent existence is a perfection.
  3. (So) God exists.

This won’t do. The argument is now clearly invalid. The most that we can conclude, from the premise set is: (By definition) God has independent existence. And it simply does not follow from this that God exists. No informed agnostic or atheist, when presented with an argument that begins with the claim that, by definition, God is the being that has every perfection, will reach any conclusion other than that there is no being that has every perfection (on the grounds that there is no God).

There are other fixes to which one might turn. Perhaps we might follow recent discussion which claims that all that Descartes wants to commit himself to, initially, is that it is obvious to intuition that God has every perfection.

  1. Intuitively, God has every perfection.
  2. Independent existence is a perfection.
  3. (So) God exists.

On the most natural reading of this argument, it suffers from the same liability as the very first argument that we associated with the Cartesian text: given that we accept that p follows from intuitively p, it is clear that informed agnostics and atheists reject that claim that intuitively, God has every perfection. And, on what seems a less natural reading of the argument, which takes it to be saying something like the following:

  1. It seems intuitive to me (Descartes) that God has every perfection.
  2. Independent existence is a perfection.
  3. (So) God exists.

the argument is obviously invalid. Why should informed agnostics or atheists be in the least bit impressed by what seems intuitive to Descartes on the question whether God has every perfection?

There is a general lesson that we can extract at this point. If we represent our Cartesian argument in the following way:

  1. [Operator] God has every perfection.
  2. Independent existence is a perfection.
  3. (So) God exists.

then we can raise the following question: what could possibly go in for [Operator] that would both (a) yield a claim that is acceptable to informed agnostics and atheists, and (b) deliver a valid argument? It is tempting to suggest that, at least setting Meinongian considerations to one side, it is obvious that there isn’t anything that can fit this bill.

There is a very large and complicated literature on Cartesian ontological arguments. Apart from the discussion in the SEP entry on Descartes’ ontological argument, readers might like to consider: Nolan (2018).

6. Proslogion II

There is an enormous literature on the material in Proslogion II–IV. Some commentators deny that Anselm tried to put forward any proofs of the existence of God. Even among commentators who agree that Anselm intended to prove the existence of God, there is disagreement about where the proof is located. Some commentators claim that the main proof is in Proslogion II, and that the rest of the work draws out corollaries of that proof (see, e.g., Charlesworth 1965). Other commentators claim that the main proof is in Proslogion III, and that the proof in Proslogion II is merely an inferior first attempt (see, e.g., Malcolm 1960). Yet other commentators claim that there is a single proof which spans at least Proslogion II–III (see, e.g., Campbell 1976 and Tapp & Siegwart 2022) and, perhaps, the entire work (see, e.g., La Croix 1972). In what follows, we ignore this aspect of the controversy about the Proslogion. Instead, we focus just on the question of the analysis of the material in Proslogion II on the assumption that there is an independent argument, for the existence (in reality) of that than which no greater can be conceived, that is given therein.

Here is one translation of the crucial part of Proslogion II (due to William Mann [1972: 260–1]; alternative translations can be found in Barnes 1972, Campbell 1976, Charlesworth 1965, and elsewhere):

Thus even the fool is convinced that something than which nothing greater can be conceived is in the understanding, since when he hears this, he understands it; and whatever is understood is in the understanding. And certainly that than which a greater cannot be conceived cannot be in the understanding alone. For if it is even in the understanding alone, it can be conceived to exist in reality also, which is greater. Thus if that than which a greater cannot be conceived is in the understanding alone, then that than which a greater cannot be conceived is itself that than which a greater can be conceived. But surely this cannot be. Thus without doubt something than which a greater cannot be conceived exists, both in the understanding and in reality.

There have been many ingenious attempts to find an argument which can be expressed in modern logical formalism, which is logically valid, and which might plausibly be claimed to be the argument which is expressed in this passage. As a first effort, we might suppose that the argument might be represented as follows:

  1. When the fool hears the words ‘that than which no greater can be conceived’ he understands those words. (Premise)
  2. Whatever is understood exists in the understanding. (Premise)
  3. (So) That than which no greater can be conceived exists in the understanding. (From i, ii)
  4. If that than which no greater can be conceived exists in the understanding, it can be conceived to exist in reality. (Premise)
  5. That than which no greater can be conceived is greater if it exists in reality than if it exists only in the understanding. (Premise)
  6. It is impossible to conceive of something greater than that than which no greater can be conceived. (Premise)
  7. (So) That than which no greater can be conceived exists in reality. (From iii, iv, v, and vi.)

The obvious difficulty with this representation is that it is not exactly clear how we are meant to get to (vii) from (iii), (iv), (v), and (vi). We might hope to confront this difficulty by ‘translating’ Anselm’s argument into a different idiom. However, attempts to recast Anselm’s argument in modal terms or Meinongian terms seem not to do justice both to Anselm’s argumentative ambitions and to other sections of the Proslogion.

If we stick with a formulation that stays close to the original text, then there are many other questions of interpretation that remain to be addressed. In particular, the key vocabulary that is used in framing this argument raises many issues. What is it for one thing to be ‘greater’ than another? What is required for it to be true that something ‘can be conceived’? What is meant by ‘the understanding’? What is it for something to ‘exist in the understanding’? How is ‘existence in the understanding’ related to being something that ‘can be conceived’? Can the very same thing ‘exist in the understanding’ and ‘exist in reality’? If so, does it have the very same properties ‘in the understanding’ and ‘in reality’? Since we certainly appear to understand the expression ‘the really existent tallest inhabitant of the planet Mars’, does Anselm think that the really existent tallest inhabitant of the planet Mars exists in the understanding? If so, does he think that, in the understanding, the really existent tallest inhabitant of the planet Mars has the property of really existing? If so, does he think that it follows that the really existent tallest inhabitant of the planet Mars has the property of really existing? Would Anselm be uncomfortable with a priori commitment to the real existence of Martians? Would he deny that we understand the expression ‘the really existent tallest inhabitant of the planet Mars’? Would he say that, even though, in the understanding, the really existent tallest inhabitant of the planet Mars has the property of really existing, nonetheless it does not follow that that the really existent tallest inhabitant of the planet Mars has the property of really existing? And so on.

The important point here is that, until we are given answers to the questions raised in the previous paragraph, we have no way of determining whether anyone can safely accept Anselm’s theoretical framework. It is not true that the only important question is whether Anselm’s conclusion follows from his premises. Another equally important question is what else follows from the (perhaps tacit) theory that informs Anselm’s construction of the argument. If that theory has absurd consequences, then the validity of the argument is inconsequential.

The literature on Proslogion II–IV is so vast that it could easily have an entry devoted solely to it. Important recent contributions to the literature include: Campbell (2018); Holopainen (2020); Leftow (2022); Speaks (2018); and Tapp & Siegwart (2022). Finally, see Smith (2014) for an Anselmian causal-cum-ontological argument.

7. Meinong

It is very natural to affirm both of the following things:

(1)
Santa Claus has a white beard.
(2)
Santa Claus does not exist.

However, if we affirm both (1) and (2), then it seems that we are committed to the claim that there are non-existent beings. What makes (1) true is that there is a being, Santa Claus, that has a white beard. What makes (2) true is that that being is non-existent.

As Russell noted, naive theories about non-existent beings are apt to end in contradiction. Perhaps we can happily accept that the tall Martian is tall (for a Martian) while also accepting that the tall Martian is non-existent. But we contradict ourselves if we say that the existent Martian is existent while also maintaining that the existent Martian is non-existent.

The general point here is that, when we think about which assignments of properties to beings could receive our a priori endorsement, we have to put limitations on the class of properties that figure in those assignments. While we might be happy with the idea that we know a priori that the tall Martian is tall (for a Martian), we know that we cannot be happy with the idea that we know a priori that the existent Martian is existent. Of course, it should not be thought that existence is the only problematic property: we can no more give a priori endorsement to any of the following:

(3)
The possible round square is possible.
(4)
The necessary round square is necessary.
(5)
The actual round square is actual.

The upshot for ontological arguments is clear. If your theory commits you to a distinction between being and existence, then, while that theory alone may give you that it is true that Santa Claus has a white beard, that theory alone does not give you that God is a perfect being (if, for example, perfection requires existence, or necessary existence, or the like). A proponent of the simple Cartesian argument that we considered earlier cannot properly claim that the truth of the first premise—‘God has every perfection’—simply falls out of the general (Meinongian) theory of being and existence while also insisting that the second premise is true.

Moreover, it should be noted that we cannot avoid this conclusion by preferring a theoretical framework in which, because essence is prior to existence, claims like ‘Santa Claus has a white beard’ are made true by essences. While it might be true that it falls out of this kind of theory that ‘The tallest Martian is tall (for a Martian)’ is made true by the essence of the tallest Martian, it cannot be true that ‘The necessary tallest Martian is necessary’ is made true by the essence of the necessary tallest Martian. Of course, it is open to theists to claim, on other grounds, that there is a divine essence; but while that can entitle them to suppose that our Cartesian ontological argument is sound, it is plainly insufficient to entitle them to suppose that our Cartesian ontological argument is such as ought to persuade agnostics and atheists to accept its conclusion.

The point that we have just made extends to other ontological arguments. In particular, it extends to Meinongian interpretations of Anselm’s argument. While, as we noted above, it is not entirely clear how to understand talk about ‘the understanding’, etc., it is tempting to interpret it in a Meinongian light. However, if we do that, then the formulation of the argument requires assumptions—rejected by atheists and agnostics—that do not simply fall out of the general Meinongian theoretical framework.

For further discussion of Meinongian ontological arguments, see, for example: Dummett (1983 [1993]); Oppenheimer & Zalta (1991); Oppy (1996); Priest (2018); and Salmon (1987). And, for Meinongianism itself, see the entry on non-existent objects and the literature cited therein.

8. Modal

The modal ontological argument (MOA) proceeds from God’s possible existence to God’s actual existence. While different variations of the argument exist (e.g., Malcolm 1960, Hartshorne 1965, Plantinga 1974), they typically share four parts:

  • The first part is a characterisation of the being to be argued for. Some MOAs focus on a maximally great being, where a being is maximally great if and only if it exists necessarily and is essentially omnipotent, omniscient, and morally perfect (Plantinga 1974). Other MOAs focus on a perfect being, where a being is perfect if and only if it essentially possesses every perfection and essentially lacks every imperfection (Bernstein 2014). Still other MOAs focus simply on God (McIntosh 2021). The precise characterisation at play will influence the justification of the second and third parts.
  • The second part is the possibility premise, which asserts that the characterised being is metaphysically possible. (Metaphysical possibility is here understood minimally as the broadest kind of objective, non-epistemic possibility.)
  • The third part is the necessity premise, which asserts that the characterised being would be a metaphysically necessary being—in any possible world in which the being exists, it is necessary that said being exists.
  • The fourth part is a modal logic that (a) accurately captures metaphysical modality and (b) is strong enough to validate an inference from the possible necessary existence of \(x\) to the necessary existence of \(x\) (or, minimally, to the existence of \(x\)). Typically used is S5, whose characteristic axiom is \(\Diamond p \rightarrow \Box\Diamond p\), which in turn entails \(\Diamond\Box p \rightarrow \Box p\) (Rasmussen 2018: 180). But a weaker system like B validates \(\Diamond\Box p \rightarrow p\) and could therefore be used instead (Leftow 2005).

Thus, with God as our characterised being and S5 as our modal logic, a standard formulation of the MOA runs:

i.
Possibly, God exists. (Possibility premise)
ii.
Necessarily, if God exists, then it is necessary that God exists. (Necessity premise)
iii.
(Hence) It is necessary that God exists. (From i, ii)

According to (ii), it’s true in any possible world in which God exists that it is necessary that God exists. According to (i), there’s some possible world in which God exists. From (i) and (ii) it follows that there’s some possible world in which it is necessary that God exists—i.e., it’s possibly necessary that God exists. By S5, \(\Diamond\Box p \rightarrow \Box p\). Hence, it’s necessary that God exists. By axiom M (\(\Box p \rightarrow p\)), it follows that God exists.

Naturally, there are three ways to challenge the MOA so construed, each corresponding to the final three parts articulated earlier. First, one can challenge the inference from (i) and (ii) to (iii) by challenging whether the modal logic underlying the argument accurately captures metaphysical modality. (For some such challenges, see Chandler 1976 and Salmon 1989. For defences of S5’s metaphysical adequacy, see Pruss & Rasmussen 2018: 14–29, Williamson 2016, Hale 2013, and Leftow 1991: 6–14). Second, one can challenge the necessity premise. While some characterisations (e.g., maximally great being as defined above) render the premise definitionally true, others require substantive argumentation. For example, if the characterisation at play is perfect being, then the MOA proponent must argue that necessary existence is a perfection. Similarly, if the characterisation at play is God, then the MOA proponent must justify the claim that God would be a necessary being. (Against this claim, see Swinburne 2012. Against Swinburne and for God’s necessity, see Rasmussen 2016.) Third, one can challenge the possibility premise by arguing either that the characterised being is metaphysically impossible or that its metaphysical possibility hasn’t been adequately justified. Falling into this third category is perhaps the most important objection to the MOA: the symmetry problem.

To draw out this problem, consider the following Reverse MOA (RMOA):

i*.
Possibly, God doesn’t exist.
ii.
Necessarily, if God exists, then it is necessary that God exists.
iii*.
(Hence) It is necessary that God doesn’t exist. (i*, ii)

Like the MOA, the RMOA is valid in S5. To see this, notice that (i*) is the negation of (iii) and that (iii) follows from (i) and (ii) in S5. Hence, (i*) and (ii) together entail the negation of (i)—i.e., they entail that it is impossible that God exists. This impossibility, in turn, is logically equivalent to (iii*).

But (iii*) is incompatible with (iii), and (ii) is the same in both arguments. Thus, assuming (ii) and S5, (i) and (i*) are incompatible. And yet (i) and (i*) seem epistemically on par—it seems intolerably arbitrary to privilege one over the other absent further considerations. What’s needed is some principled reason favouring one over the other, i.e., a consideration that breaks symmetry between them. Absent such a symmetry breaker, however, the MOA is dialectically toothless—quite clearly, if you don’t already accept the claim that God exists, you won’t agree that (i) is more acceptable than (i*) absent some symmetry breaker. Thus, without a symmetry breaker, the MOA makes no headway in the dispute between theists and non-theists.

The natural solution to the symmetry problem, of course, is to offer a symmetry breaker favouring (i) over (i*). Categorisation problems loom on the horizon here—for example, many such symmetry breakers appeal to premises that aren’t a priori, and so they threaten MOA’s status as a properly ontological argument. Furthermore, even if they only appeal to a priori premises, symmetry breakers may represent distinct ontological arguments in their own right—distinct, that is, from the MOA. Notwithstanding these concerns, the MOA debate has centred around symmetry breaking, and hence symmetry breakers merit consideration here.

For further discussion of the most influential MOA—Plantinga’s MOA—see (e.g.) Adams (1988), Chandler (1993), Oppy (1995: 70–78, 248–259), Tooley (1981), van Inwagen (1977), and Rasmussen (2018). For a recent re-casting of the modal ontological argument using only a standard extension of system K, see Hausmann (2022).

9. Gödel

We begin with a representative Gödelian ontological argument. This argument—like all Gödelian ontological arguments—is couched in terms of the notion of a positive property. The conclusion of the argument is that there is a being whose essential properties are all and only the positive properties. The argument has the following premises:

  1. A property \(A\) is positive only if its negation \(\neg A\) is not positive.
  2. If \(A\) is positive and \(A\) entails \(B\) then \(B\) is positive.
  3. Having as essential properties all and only the positive properties is positive.
  4. Necessary existence is positive.

From (i) and (ii), we can infer that any collection of positive properties is possibly jointly instantiated. Given (iii), we can then infer that having as essential properties all and only the positive properties is possibly instantiated. Given (iv), we can then infer that having as essential properties all and only the positive properties is possibly necessarily instantiated. And then, assuming that the modal logic is S5, we infer that there is a necessarily existent being that has all and only the positive properties. (See Pruss 2018a for discussion of ways in which this representative argument can be improved. These improvements have no bearing on the subsequent discussion in this section.)

Perhaps the most important point to note, for discussion of this argument, is the following: no property that is necessarily uninstantiated is positive. Suppose that \(A\) is necessarily uninstantiated but positive. Since \(A\) is necessarily uninstantiated, for any \(B\), \(A\) entails \(B\) and \(A\) entails \(\neg B\). But by 2—since any property entailed by a positive property is itself positive—\(B\) is positive and \(\neg B\) is positive. But, by 1, if \(B\) is positive, then \(\neg B\) is not positive. Contradiction. Hence, if \(A\) is necessarily uninstantiated, then \(A\) is not positive.

In the context of necessary being theism, it is controversial between theists and atheists which properties are necessarily uninstantiated. Atheists who suppose—as many do—that omnipotence, omniscience, perfect goodness, and so forth, are necessarily uninstantiated deny that omnipotence, omniscience, perfect goodness, and so forth, are positive (on the assumption that positive properties obey both 1 and 2). Moreover, some—though not all—atheists deny that necessary existence is positive (on the assumption that positive properties obey both 1 and 2). Unless we have an independent, non-question-begging way to discern which properties are positive, this looks like game over for Gödelian ontological arguments.

A significant part of the recent literature has tried to motivate particular ways of understanding the notion of a positive property. We might take the relevant axioms to provide a partial definition of positivity; but those axioms provide no guidance when it comes to substantive content. Pruss (2018a) discusses five candidate substantive proposals:

  • Comparison. A property \(A\) is positive iff for any \(x\), it is better for \(x\) to have \(A\) then for \(x\) to lack \(A\).
  • Excellence. A property \(A\) is positive iff for any \(x\), having \(A\) in no way detracts from the excellence of \(x\), but having \(\neg A\) does in some way detract from the excellence of \(x\).
  • Anti-Negativity. A property \(A\) is positive iff \(\neg A\) is negative.
  • Leibniz. A property is positive iff \(A\) is entailed by a (possibly trivial) conjunction of simple, absolute properties,
  • No Limitations. A property \(A\) is positive iff \(A\) does not entail being limited and \(\neg A\) does entail being limited.

One obvious problem with all of these proposals, in the context of the important point noted above, is that they do not give definitive guidance when it comes to controversial cases in which some hold that a property is necessarily uninstantiated and others do not. Consider necessary omnipotence. If it is impossible for anything to be necessarily omnipotent—and if we are holding onto the assumption that positive properties are non-trivially closed under entailment—then:

  1. it is clearly not the case that it is better to be necessarily omnipotent than to be not necessarily omnipotent;
  2. it is clearly not the case that being necessarily omnipotent does not detract from excellence in any way;
  3. it is clearly not the case that not being necessarily omnipotent is negative;
  4. it is clearly not the case that being necessarily omnipotent is entailed by a (possibly trivial) conjunction of simple, absolute properties; and
  5. it is clearly not the case that not being necessarily omnipotent entails being limited.

While there are other difficulties that confront all of these proposals, there is no need to engage in exploration of those difficulties here.

Perhaps there is one final point worth making. There is nothing that we have said here that suggests that one cannot rationally suppose that

  1. the positive properties are non-trivially closed under entailment, and
  2. necessary existence, necessary omnipotence, necessary omniscience and necessary perfect goodness are all positive properties.

Nor does anything in what we have said suggest that one who rationally supposes these things cannot find the various claims intuitive. What matters here is only that, given the conditions that we have set for determining whether or not arguments are successful, what certain theists find intuitive has no bearing on the success of Gödel’s ontological argument.

The literature on Gödel and Gödel’s ontological argument is vast. Notable contributions include: Adams (1995); Anderson (1990); Hazen (1998); Kovač (2003); Pruss (2009, 2018a); Pruss & Rasmussen (2018: ch. 8); Sobel (1987, 2004); and Świętorzecka [ed.] (2015).

10. Hegel

There is a large literature on Hegel and ‘the ontological argument’. As noted by Redding and Bubbio (2014: 467–8), Hegel was clearly attracted to Anselm’s Proslogion argument. However, Hegel thought that Kant had shown that Anselm’s Proslogion argument is fatally flawed. But Hegel also thought that the fatal flaw that Kant had identified could be overcome. Assessing this last claim of Hegel’s is not easy. In particular, as many people have noted, Hegel nowhere gives an explicit formulation of the premises and conclusion of ‘the ontological argument’ that he endorses. Given the conception of argument with which we have been working, it is not clear that there is any such thing as ‘the ontological argument’ that Hegel endorsed.

Redding and Bubbio attempt to

point a way towards a reconstruction of the [ontological argument] from the framework within which Hegel makes his diagnosis [of the incompleteness of the Proslogion argument]. (2014: 466)

However, they do not give an explicit formulation of the premises and conclusion of ‘the ontological argument’ that Hegel is alleged to endorse. Instead, they outline some important parts of Hegel’s philosophy, and claim that something that might be taken to be the conclusion of ‘the ontological argument’ fits comfortably with that outline.

The interpretation of Hegel’s philosophy is, of course, controversial. As noted in Redding (2020), we can distinguish between at least:

  1. the traditional metaphysical view of Hegel’s philosophy (Taylor 1975; Rosen 1984);
  2. the ‘non-metaphysical’ Kantian view of Hegel’s philosophy (Pippin 1989; Pinkard 1994; Brandom 2002; McDowell 2006); and
  3. the revised metaphysical view of Hegel’s philosophy (Stern 2002; Houlgate 2005; Kreines 2006; Yeomans 2012).

Moreover, the interpretation of Hegel’s writings about religion and God are also controversial: perhaps depending upon which of his writings we emphasise, we may take him to be Christian, pantheist, or atheist.

According to Redding and Bubbio:

The speech of act of mutual forgiveness, says Hegel, ‘is God manifested in the midst of those who know themselves in the form of pure knowledge’. In the human act of forgiveness, God is fleetingly given corporeal existence, and what looks like human acts provide the occasion of the self-actualisation of the divine. Indeed, Hegel seems to conceive of the apparently human act of proving the existence of God in the same way. It is an act in which God passes from ‘mere’ concept into existing ‘idea’. And it is fitting that this happens within the medium proper to Hegel’s God—thought. (2014: 482)

What should those who identify as atheists or agnostics make of this? They can clearly acknowledge that there are human acts of mutual forgiveness. But, in the light of the history of religion, theology, etc., they will likely have not the slightest temptation to invoke God or the divine when we make this acknowledgement. Moreover, and consequently, they will simply dismiss talk about God’s passing from “‘mere’ concept to existing ‘idea’”: whatever content you might want to attribute to that talk, it simply does not touch atheists and agnostics. The notion that there is an argument here that ought to persuade atheists and agnostics to revise their worldviews seems utterly forlorn. This is not to deny that, from within a Hegelian perspective, these claims might be seen to be utterly compelling. No doubt there are people who suppose that in human acts of forgiveness, God passes from ‘mere’ concept to existing ‘idea’. But those people have a range of controversial theoretical commitments that are not shared by atheists and agnostics (nor by a great many theists, we might add).

11. Parodies

There is a large literature discussing parodies of ontological arguments, beginning with Gaunilo’s ‘perfect island’ objection to Anselm’s Proslogion II argument. It is important to note, at the outset, that particular parodies are tied to particular formulations of ontological arguments, and are intended only to raise questions about the probative value of those particular formulations of ontological arguments.

Consider our earlier formulation of Anselm’s Proslogion II argument:

  1. When the fool hears the words ‘that than which no greater can be conceived’ he understands those words. (Premise)
  2. Whatever is understood exists in the understanding. (Premise)
  3. (So) That than which no greater can be conceived exists in the understanding. (From i, ii)
  4. If that than which no greater can be conceived exists in the understanding, it can be conceived to exist in reality. (Premise)
  5. That than which no greater can be conceived is greater if it exists in reality than if it exists only in the understanding. (Premise)
  6. It is impossible to conceive of something greater than that than which no greater can be conceived. (Premise)
  7. (So) That than which no greater can be conceived exists in reality. (From iii, iv, v, and vi.)

We can formulate a perfect island parody as follows:

  1. When the fool hears the words ‘that island than which no greater island can be conceived’ he understands those words. (Premise)
  2. Whatever is understood exists in the understanding. (Premise)
  3. (So) That island than which no greater island can be conceived exists in the understanding. (From i, ii)
  4. If that island than which no greater island can be conceived exists in the understanding, it can be conceived to exist in reality. (Premise)
  5. That island than which no greater island can be conceived is greater if it exists in reality than if it exists only in the understanding. (Premise)
  6. It is impossible to conceive of some island greater than that island than which no greater island can be conceived. (Premise)
  7. (So) That island than which no greater island can be conceived exists in reality. (From iii, iv, v, and vi.)

Since the arguments have the same logical form, either they are both valid or they are both invalid. If they are both invalid, then the Proslogion II argument fails. If they are both valid, then, if the Proslogion II argument is to succeed, there must be a premise pair concerning which atheists and agnostics suppose that the premise in the first argument is true but the premise in the second argument is false. Which premise pair could that be?

Arguably, not the first. Which atheists and agnostics are going to suppose that, while the words ‘that than which no greater can be conceived’ are understood, the words ‘that island than which no greater island can be conceived’ are not understood? (If you think that islands—unlike beings in general—do not admit of comparison in terms of greatness, we can change the example. The parody does not need to be formulated in terms of islands. It can, for example, be formulated in terms of scores on a test for which there is a maximum possible score: ‘that score on this test than which no greater score on this test can be conceived’.)

Definitely not the second, since it is the same for both arguments.

Arguably, not the third. As noted above, all we need for the purposes of the parody is some category for which we think that existence in reality is great-making compared to mere existence in the understanding. It is not clear why atheists and agnostics should think that existence in reality (as compared to existence in the understanding) is great-making for that than which no greater can be conceived and yet not great-making for that island than which no greater island can be conceived. But, in any case, which atheists and agnostics are going to accept that existence in reality (as compared to existence in the understanding) is great-making for that than which no greater can be conceived and yet not great-making for that score on this test for which no greater score on this test can be conceived?

And surely not the fourth. Which atheists or agnostics would accept that nothing is greater than that than which no greater can be conceived and yet deny that no island is greater than that island than which no greater can be conceived?

The upshot seems pretty clear: it cannot be that Anselm’s Proslogion II argument, as formulated for the purposes of this discussion, is a successful argument for its conclusion because (a) it has nothing to recommend it to atheists and agnostics that does not equally recommend the conclusion of the island parody argument to atheists and agnostics, and yet (b) we all know that the conclusion of the island parody argument is false (if not absurd).

Perhaps one will object that, in the relevant sense, while we do understand the words ‘that than which no greater can be conceived’, we do not understand the words ‘that island than which no greater island can be conceived’. Perhaps, for example, we might suggest, following Plantinga, that, since we know a priori that there is no intrinsic maximum for the greatness of islands, we can attach no sense to the words ‘island than which no greater island can be conceived’. According to Plantinga, any island, no matter how great, can be improved by the addition of more palm trees. While there is an intrinsic maximum for knowledge—knowing everything—there is no intrinsic maximum for the number of palm trees on an island. There are at least the following three points to make here. First, it seems false that the addition of palm trees is guaranteed to add to the greatness of an island. For any island, there comes a point where the addition of more palm trees overcrowds the island with palm trees, and so detracts from its greatness. (Of course, the point here generalises to any other kinds of things that might be taken to conduce to the greatness of islands. There is nothing that might conduce to the greatness of islands for which it is guaranteed that, no matter how much you have, more will be better.) Second, the greatness of islands will inevitably involve a trade-off between various things that contribute to greatness of islands. We simply do not know a priori that there is no distribution of these things that is an intrinsic maximum for the greatness of islands. Third, even if these objections are waived, until we have a satisfactory detailed theory of existence in the understanding, conceivability, etc., we have no grounds for moving from these points to the claim that we do not understand the words ‘that island than which no greater island can be conceived’ when we hear them. (For more on these responses—and for other responses—see Oppy 2017: 54–56.)

The discussion to this point illustrates the general strategy that is pursued by those who look for parodies of a given ontological argument. Such people have been presented with an argument for the existence of God. What they seek is an argument, with the same logical form as the argument that has been presented to them, that has at its conclusion either that something exists whose existence is incompatible with the existence of God or that something exists whose existence is recognised by all to be absurd, and yet whose premises are all no less acceptable to those who frame the parody than the corresponding premises in the ontological argument that has been presented to them. (Of course, the discussion in preceding paragraphs is an instance of the second kind: the conclusion of the argument is something that is recognised on all hands to be absurd.)

Why might someone offer a parody of an ontological argument rather than either a criticism of the logic or premises of that ontological argument? If someone can show that an ontological argument is invalid, then their best objection to the ontological argument is to demonstrate its invalidity. And, if someone can show even to proponents of an ontological argument that the argument has one or more false premises, then their best objection to the ontological argument is to show the falsity of one or more of its premises. But, often enough, an opponent of a given ontological argument may not be able to do either of those things. However, if they can provide a successful parody of the argument, then they still have an adequate objection to the argument. For an argument like Anselm’s Proslogion II argument, where the background theory and the logic are greatly underspecified, it may well be that parody offers the most immediate way to make it clear to proponents of the argument that there is nothing in the argument that ought to give pause to atheists and agnostics.

Even in cases where opponents of given ontological arguments suppose that they can demonstrate invalidity or falsity of premises, there may still be at least academic interest in parodies of those arguments. However, it seems doubtful that there could be more than academic interest in providing parodies in such cases.

12. General Objections

Objections to ontological arguments take many forms. Some objections are intended to apply only to particular ontological arguments, or particular forms of ontological arguments; other objections are intended to apply to all ontological arguments. It is a controversial question whether there are any successful general objections to ontological arguments.

One general criticism of ontological arguments which have appeared hitherto is this: none of them is persuasive, i.e., none of them provides those who do not already accept the conclusion that God exists—and who are reasonable, reflective, well-informed, etc.—with either a pro tanto reason or an all-things-considered reason to accept that conclusion. Any reading of any ontological argument which has been produced so far which is sufficiently clearly stated to admit of evaluation yields a result which is invalid, or possesses a set of premises which it is clear in advance that no reasonable, reflective, well-informed, etc. non-theists should accept, or has a benign conclusion which has no religious significance, or else falls prey to more than one of the above failings.

As we have seen in the discussion that we have given above, for each of the families of arguments introduced in our initial taxonomy, there are good reasons for thinking that none of the extant arguments that belong to those families are successful.

Even if the forgoing analyses are correct, it is important to note that no argument has been given for the conclusion that no ontological argument can be successful. Even if all of the kinds of arguments produced to date are unsuccessful—i.e., not such as ought to give non-theists reason to accept the conclusion that God exists—it remains an open question whether there is some other kind of hitherto undiscovered ontological argument which does succeed. (Perhaps it is worth adding here that there is fairly widespread consensus, even amongst theists, that no known ontological arguments for the existence of God are successful, in the sense in which we are here understanding what it is for an argument to be successful. Most categories of ontological argument have some actual defenders; but none has a large following.)

Many other objections to (some) ontological arguments have been proposed. All of the following have been alleged to be the key to the explanation of the failure of (at least some) ontological arguments:

  1. existence is not a predicate (see, e.g., Kant; Smart 1955; Alston 1960);
  2. the concept of god is meaningless/incoherent/inconsistent (see, e.g., Findlay 1948);
  3. ontological arguments are ruled out by “the missing explanation argument” (see Johnston 1992);
  4. ontological arguments all trade on mistaken uses of singular terms (see, e.g., Barnes 1972);
  5. existence is not a perfection (see almost any textbook in philosophy of religion);
  6. ontological arguments presuppose a Meinongian approach to ontology (see, e.g., Dummett 1983 [1993]); and
  7. ontological arguments are question-begging, i.e., presuppose what they set out to prove (see, e.g., Rowe 1989).

There are many things to say about these objections: the most important point is that almost all of them require far more controversial assumptions than non-theists require in order to be able to reject ontological arguments with good conscience. Trying to support most of these claims merely in order to beat up on ontological arguments is unlikely to be a productive undertaking.

Of course, all of the above discussion is directed only to the claim that ontological arguments are dialectically inefficacious—i.e., they give reasonable non-theists no reason to change their views. It might be wondered whether there is some other use which ontological arguments have—e.g., as Plantinga claims, in establishing the reasonableness of theism. This seems unlikely. After all, at best these arguments show that certain sets of sentences (beliefs, etc.) are inconsistent—one cannot reject the conclusions of these arguments while accepting their premises. But the arguments themselves say nothing about the reasonableness of accepting the premises. So the arguments themselves say nothing about the (unconditional) reasonableness of accepting the conclusions of these arguments. Those who are disposed to think that theism is irrational need find nothing in ontological arguments to make them change their minds (and those who are disposed to think that theism is true should take no comfort from them either).

13. Concluding Observations

It will be useful to collect together some of the main points that have been made in the preceding discussion:

  • There are many different extant kinds of ontological arguments.
  • Some ontological arguments display potential entailments between the possibility of God’s existence (or non-existence) and the necessity of God’s existence (or non-existence). These entailments put a spotlight on an open, general question: under what conditions can one reasonably believe something of the form, ‘it is possible that F’ without merely deriving that conclusion from ‘it is actual that F’?
  • There are significant challenges to extant ontological arguments, and they may cast doubt on whether any current arguments provide atheists and agnostics with good or compelling reasons to become theists.
  • It remains an open question whether there are hitherto undiscovered ontological arguments that would provide atheists and agnostics with good or compelling reasons to become theists (just as it remains an open question whether there are hitherto undiscovered parodies of ontological arguments that would provide theists with good or compelling reasons to become atheists or agnostics).
  • It may well be that theists have—or can have—good reasons for thinking that there are sound ontological arguments. That is: it may well be that there are valid ontological arguments all of whose premises are such that theists can reasonably deem them intuitive.
  • It remains an open question whether theists can give a plausible account of a way in which arguments can be successful on which it turns out that at least one extant ontological argument is successful. ‘Plausibility’ constrains the account in at least the following way: it is not plausible that ‘God exists and \(2+2=4\) therefore God exists’ is a successful argument, even though all monotheists accept that it is (classically) sound.

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