Platonism in Metaphysics

First published Wed May 12, 2004; substantive revision Tue Dec 24, 2024

Platonism is the view that there exist such things as abstract objects—where (on one standard definition) an abstract object is an object that’s non-spatial, non-temporal, non-physical, non-mental, and non-causal. Platonism in this sense is a contemporary view. It is obviously related to the views of Plato in important ways, but it is not entirely clear that Plato endorsed this view, as it is defined here. In order to remain neutral on this question, the term “platonism” is spelled with a lower-case “p” (see the entry on Plato). The most important figure in the development of modern platonism is Gottlob Frege (1884, 1892, 1893/1903, 1918/19). The view has also been endorsed by many others, including Kurt Gödel (1947), Bertrand Russell (1912), and W.V.O. Quine (1948, 1951).

Section 1 will describe the contemporary platonist view in detail. Section 2 will describe the alternatives to platonism—namely, immanent realism, conceptualism, nominalism, Meinongianism, and non-factualism. Section 3 will develop and assess the first important argument in favor of platonism, namely, the One Over Many argument. Section 4 will develop and assess a second argument for platonism, namely, the ontological-commitment argument. This argument emerged much later than the One Over Many argument, but as we will see, it is widely thought to be more powerful. Finally, section 5 will develop and assess the most important argument against platonism, namely, the epistemological argument.

1. What is Platonism?

Platonism is the view that there exist abstract objects, where an abstract object is an object that’s non-spatial (i.e., not spatially extended or located), non-temporal, non-physical (i.e., not made of physical stuff), non-mental (i.e., not a minds or an idea in a mind or a disembodied soul, or anything else along these lines), and non-causal (i.e., causally inert).

(It’s important to note that there is no consensus in the literature on how exactly “abstract object” is to be defined. For instance, some philosophers would want to remove one or more of the requirements from the above definition; e.g., some people would remove the requirement for causal inertness. If we do remove some of the requirements from the above definition, then more kinds of views will count as platonist views—e.g., the view that there are non-physical, non-mental, non-spatiotemporal objects that are causally efficacious.[1] The question of how exactly “abstract object” should be defined won’t matter in what follows; but for more on this issue, see the entry on abstract objects, as well as Cowling 2017; Plebani 2020; and Liggins 2024.)

The above definition of “abstract object” might be somewhat perplexing; for with all of these claims about what abstract objects are not, it might be unclear what they are. We can clarify things, however, by looking at some examples.

Consider the sentence “3 is prime”. This sentence seems to say something about a particular object, namely, the number 3. Just as the sentence “The moon is round” says something about the moon, so too “3 is prime” seems to say something about the number 3. But what is the number 3? There are a few different views that one might endorse here, but the platonist view is that 3 is an abstract object. On this view, 3 is a real and objective thing that, like the moon, exists independently of us and our thinking (i.e., it is not just an idea in our heads). But according to platonism, 3 is different from the moon in that it is not a physical object; it is wholly non-physical, non-mental, and causally inert, and it does not exist in space or time. One might put this metaphorically by saying that on the platonist view, numbers exist “in platonic heaven”. But we should not infer from this that according to platonism, numbers exist in a place; they do not, for the concept of a place is a physical, spatial concept. It is more accurate to say that on the platonist view, numbers exist (independently of us and our thoughts) but do not exist in space and time.

Similarly, many philosophers take a platonistic view of properties. Consider, for instance, the property of being red. According to the platonist view of properties, the property of redness exists independently of any red thing. There are red balls and red houses and red shirts, and these all exist in the physical world. But platonists about properties believe that in addition to these things, redness—the property itself—also exists, and according to platonists, this property is an abstract object. Ordinary red objects are said to exemplify or instantiate redness.

Platonists of this sort say the same thing about other properties as well: in addition to all the beautiful things, there is also beauty; and in addition to all the tigers, there is also the property of being a tiger. Indeed, even when there are no instances of a property in reality, platonists will typically maintain that the property itself exists. This isn’t to say that platonists are committed to the thesis that there is a property corresponding to every predicate in the English language. The point is simply that in typical cases, there will be a property. For instance, according to this sort of platonism, there exists a property of being a four-hundred-story building, even though there are no such things as four-hundred-story buildings. This property exists outside of space and time along with redness. The only difference is that in our physical world, the one property happens to be instantiated whereas the other does not.

In fact, platonists extend the position here even further, for on their view, properties are just a special case of a much broader category, namely, the category of universals. It’s easy to see why one might think of a property like redness as a universal. A red ball that sits in a garage in Buffalo is a particular thing. But redness is something that is exemplified by many, many objects; it’s something that all red objects share, or have in common. This is why platonists think of redness as a universal and of specific red objects—such as balls in Buffalo, or cars in Cleveland—as particulars.

But according to this sort of platonism, properties are not the only universals; there are other kinds of universals as well, most notably, relations. Consider, for instance, the relation to the north of; this relation is instantiated by many pairs of objects (or more accurately, by ordered pairs of objects, since order matters here—e.g., to the north of is instantiated by <San Francisco, Los Angeles>, and <Edinburgh, London>, but not by <Los Angeles, San Francisco>, or <London, Edinburgh>). So according to platonism, the relation to the north of is a two-place universal, whereas a property like redness is a one-place universal. There are also three-place relations (which are three-place universals), four-place relations, and so on. An example of a three-place relation is the gave relation, which admits of a giver, a givee, and a given—as in “Jane gave Tim a present”.

Finally, some philosophers claim that propositions are abstract objects. One way to think of a proposition is as the meaning of a sentence. Alternatively, we can say that a proposition is that which is expressed by a sentence on a particular occasion of use. Either way, we can say that, e.g., the English sentence “Snow is white” and the German sentence “Schnee ist weiss” express the same proposition, namely, the proposition that snow is white.

There are many different platonistic conceptions of propositions. For instance, Frege (1892, 1918/19) held that propositions are composed of senses of words (e.g., on this view, the proposition that snow is white is composed of the senses of “snow” and “is white”), whereas Russell at one point (1905, 1911) held that propositions are composed of properties, relations, and objects (e.g., on this view, the proposition that Mars is red is composed of Mars (the planet itself) and the property of redness). Others hold that propositions do not have significant internal structure. The differences between these views will not matter for our purposes. For more detail, see the entry on propositions.

(It might seem odd to say that Russellian propositions are abstract objects. Consider, e.g., the Russellian proposition that Mars is red. This is an odd sort of hybrid object. It has two components, namely, Mars (the planet itself) and the property of redness. One of these components (namely, Mars) is a concrete object (where a concrete object is just a non-abstract object (so, presumably, a physical, spatiotemporal object). Thus, even if redness is an abstract object, it does not seem that the Russellian proposition is completely abstract. Nonetheless, philosophers typically lump these objects together with abstract objects. Perhaps it’s best to say that Russellian propositions count as abstract objects on some definitions but not others. And similar remarks can be made about various other kinds of objects. Think, for instance, of impure sets—e.g., the set containing Mars and Jupiter. This seems to be a hybrid object of some kind as well, because while it has concrete objects as members, it’s still a set, and on the standard view, sets are abstract objects. If we wanted to be really precise, it would probably be best to have another term for such objects—e.g., “hybrid object”, or “impure abstract object”—but we needn’t worry about this issue here. This essay is almost entirely concerned with what might be called pure abstract objects—i.e., abstract objects that are completely non-spatiotemporal.)

Numbers, propositions, and universals (i.e., properties and relations) are not the only things that people have taken to be abstract objects. As we will see below, people have also endorsed platonistic views in connection with linguistic objects (most notably, sentences), possible worlds, logical objects, and fictional characters (e.g., Sherlock Holmes). And it is important to note here that one can be a platonist about some of these things without being a platonist about the others—e.g., one might be a platonist about numbers and propositions but not properties or fictional characters.

Of course, platonism about any of these kinds of objects is controversial. Many philosophers do not believe in abstract objects at all. The alternatives to platonism will be discussed in section 2, but it is worth noting here that the primary argument that platonists give for their view is that, according to them, there are good arguments against all other views. That is, platonists think we have to believe in abstract objects, because (a) there are good reasons for thinking that things like numbers and properties exist, and (b) the only tenable view of these things is that they are abstract objects. We will consider these arguments in detail below.

2. A Taxonomy of Positions

There are not very many alternatives to platonism. One can reject the existence of things like numbers and properties altogether. Or one can maintain that there do exist such things as numbers and properties, and instead of saying that they are abstract objects, one can say that they are mental objects of some sort (usually, the claim is that they are ideas in our heads) or physical objects of some sort (or that they exist in physical reality, or some such thing). Thus, the four mainstream views here are as follows (and keep in mind that anti-platonists can pursue different strategies with respect to different kinds of alleged abstract objects, taking one view of, say, numbers, and another view of properties or propositions).

2.1 Platonism

Platonism is the view described in section 1.

2.2 Immanent Realism

Advocates of Immanent Realism agree with platonists that there do exist such things as mathematical objects—or properties, or whatever category of alleged abstract objects we’re talking about—and that these things are independent of us and our thinking; but immanent realists differ from platonists in holding that these objects exist in the physical world. Depending on the kind of object under discussion—i.e., whether we’re talking about mathematical objects or properties or what have you—the details of this view will be worked out differently. In connection with properties, the standard immanent-realist view is that properties exist in the physical world, in particular, in actual physical objects; so, e.g., on this view, redness exists in actual red objects (e.g., in Mars and the Golden Gate Bridge), as nonspatial parts or aspects of those things (this view traces back to Aristotle; in contemporary times, it has been defended by Armstrong 1978). There is certainly some initial plausibility to this idea: if you are looking at a red ball, and you think that in addition to the ball, its redness exists, then it seems a bit odd to say (as platonists do) that its redness exists outside of spacetime. After all, the ball is sitting right here in spacetime and we can see that it’s red; so it seems initially plausible to think that if the redness exists at all, then it exists in the ball. As we will see below, however, there are serious problems with this view.

Another kind of immanent realism says that properties are tropes, where a trope is a particular, not a universal. So, e.g., on this view, one redness-trope exists in Mars and a different redness-trope exists in the Golden Gate Bridge, whereas on an Aristotelean version of immanent realism, one and the same thing (namely, the property of redness) exists in both Mars and the Golden Gate Bridge—and, indeed, in all red things. (Note that while trope theory counts as an immanent-realist view of properties, it’s an anti-realist view of universals—because it says that there are no such things as universals.)[2]

In connection with numbers, one immanent-realist strategy is to take numbers to be properties of some sort—e.g., one might take them to be properties of piles of physical objects, so that, for instance, the number 3 would be a property of, e.g., a pile of three books—and to take an immanent realist view of properties. (This sort of view has been defended by Armstrong 1978.) But views of this kind have not been very influential in the philosophy of mathematics. A more prominent strategy for taking number talk to be about the physical world is to take it to be about actual piles of physical objects, rather than properties of piles. Thus, for instance, one might maintain that to say that \(2 + 3 = 5\) is not really to say something about specific entities (numbers); rather, it is to say that whenever we push a pile of two objects together with a pile of three objects, we will wind up with a pile of five objects—or something along these lines. Thus, on this view, arithmetic is just a very general natural science. A view of this sort was developed by Mill (1843) and, more recently, a similar view has been defended by Philip Kitcher (1984). It should be noted, however, that while there are certainly physicalist themes running through the views of Mill and Kitcher, it is not clear that either of them should be interpreted as an immanent realist. Kitcher is probably best classified as a kind of anti-realist (I’ll say a bit more about this in section 4.1), and it’s not entirely clear how Mill ought to be classified, relative to our taxonomy, because it’s not clear how he would answer the question, “Are there numbers, and if so, what are they?”

Finally, Penelope Maddy (1990) has also developed a sort of immanent realist view of mathematics. Concentrating mainly on set theory, Maddy maintains that sets of physical objects are located in space and time, right where their members are located. But Maddian sets cannot be identified with the physical matter that constitutes their members. On Maddy’s view, corresponding to every physical object, there is a huge infinity of sets (e.g., the set containing the given object, the set containing that set, and so on) that are all distinct from one another but which all share the same matter and the same spatiotemporal location. Thus, on this view, there is more to a set than the physical stuff that makes up its members, and so Maddy might be better interpreted as endorsing a nonstandard version of platonism.

2.3 Conceptualism

Conceptualism (also called psychologism and mentalism, depending on the sorts of objects under discussion) is the view that there do exist numbers—or properties, or propositions, or whatever—but that they do not exist independently of us; instead, they are mental objects; in particular, the claim is usually that they are something like ideas in our heads. As we will see below, this view has serious problems and not very many people endorse it. Nonetheless, it has had periods of popularity in the history of philosophy. It is very often thought that Locke held a conceptualistic view of universals, and prior to the twentieth century, this was the standard view of concepts and propositions. In the philosophy of mathematics, psychologistic views were popular in the late nineteenth century (the most notable proponent being the early Husserl (1891)) and even in the first part of the twentieth century with the advent of psychologistic intuitionism (Brouwer 1913 and 1949, and Heyting 1956). Finally, Noam Chomsky (1965) has endorsed a mentalistic view of sentences and other linguistic objects, and he has been followed here by others, most notably, Fodor (1975, 1987).

It should also be noted here that one can claim that the existence of numbers (or propositions or whatever) is dependent on us humans without endorsing a psychologistic view of the relevant entities. For one can combine this claim with the idea that the objects in question are abstract objects. In other words, one might claim—and some have claimed—that numbers (or propositions or whatever) are mind-dependent abstract objects, i.e., objects that exist outside of the mind, and outside of space and time, but which only came into being because of the activities of human beings. Liston (2004), Cole (2009), and Bueno (2009) endorse views of this general kind in connection with mathematical objects; Schiffer (2003: chapter 2), Soames (2014), and King (2014) endorse views like this of propositions; and Salmon (1998) and Thomasson (1999) endorse views like this of fictional objects.

2.4 Nominalism

Nominalism (also called anti-realism) is the view that there are no such things as numbers, or universals, or whatever sort of alleged abstract objects are under discussion. Thus, for instance, a nominalist about properties would say that while there are such things as red balls and red houses, there is no such thing as the property of redness, over and above the red balls and red houses. And a nominalist about numbers would say that while there are such things as piles of three stones, and perhaps “3-ideas” existing in people’s heads, there is no such thing as the number 3. As we will see below, there are many different versions of each of these kinds of nominalism, but for now, we don’t need anything more than this general formulation of the view. (Sometimes “nominalism” is used to denote the view that there are no such things as abstract objects; on this usage, “nominalism” is synonymous with “anti-platonism”, and views like immanent realism count as versions of nominalism. In contrast, on the usage employed in this essay, “nominalism” is essentially synonymous with “anti-realism”, and so views like immanent realism will not count as versions of nominalism here.)

Prima facie, it might seem that nominalism, or anti-realism, is further from the platonist view than immanent realism and conceptualism are for the simple reason that the latter two views admit that there do exist such things as numbers (or universals, or whatever). It is important to note, however, that nominalists agree with platonists on an important point that immanent realists and conceptualists reject; in particular, nominalists (in agreement with platonists) endorse the following thesis:

(S)
If there were such things as numbers (or universals, or whatever sort of alleged abstract objects we’re talking about), then they would be abstract objects; that is, they would be non-spatiotemporal, non-physical, and non-mental.

This is an extremely important point, because it turns out that there are some very compelling arguments (which we will discuss) in favor of (S). As a result, there are very few advocates of immanent realism and conceptualism, especially in connection with mathematical objects and propositions. There is wide-spread agreement about what numbers and propositions would be if there were such things (namely, abstract objects) but very little agreement as to whether there do exist such things. Thus, today, the controversial question here is a purely ontological one: Are there any such things as abstract objects (e.g., mathematical objects, propositions, and so on)?

In addition to the four views discussed so far (i.e., platonism, immanent realism, conceptualism, and nominalism), two other views are worth mentioning…

2.5 Meinongianism

According to Meinongianism (see Meinong 1904), every singular term—e.g., “Obama”, “3”, and “Sherlock Holmes”—picks out an object that has some sort of being (that subsists, or that is, in some sense) but only some of these objects exist. According to Meinongianism, sentences that platonists take to be about abstract objects—sentences like “3 is prime” and “Red is a color”—express truths about objects that don’t exist.

Meinongianism has been almost universally rejected by philosophers. The standard argument against it (see, e.g., Quine 1948: 3 and Lewis 1990) is that it does not provide a view that is clearly distinct from platonism and merely creates the illusion of a different view by altering the meaning of the term “exist”. The idea here is that on the standard meaning of “exist”, any object that has any being at all exists, and so according to standard usage, Meinongianism entails that numbers and universals exist; but this view clearly doesn’t take such things to exist in spacetime and so, the argument concludes, Meinongianism entails that numbers and universals are abstract objects—just as platonism does.

It is worth noting, however, that while Meinongianism has mostly been rejected, it does have some more contemporary advocates, most notably, Routley (1980), Terence Parsons (1980), and Priest (2003, 2005 [2016]).

2.6 Non-Factualism

All the views considered so far can be thought of as either platonist views or anti-platonist views. A final view, Non-Factualism, is that there’s no fact of the matter whether platonism is true because there’s no fact of the matter whether abstract objects exist. Views of this kind have been endorsed by Balaguer (1998a, 2021), Yablo (2009), and Warren (2016). On Balaguer’s version of the view, “abstract objects exist” is catastrophically imprecise—i.e., so imprecise that it lacks truth conditions and truth value. Roughly speaking, the idea here is that

  1. it’s built into the meaning of “abstract objects exist” that some substantive fact is required of reality to make that sentence true, but
  2. it’s catastrophically unclear what this substantive extra fact could be.

A different sort of non-factualist view, developed by Carnap (1950) and Maddy (2011), says that

  1. sentences like “3 is prime” and “Numbers exist” are trivially true (or analytic) in some languages (which we can call trivialist languages); and
  2. these sentences are false in other languages (non-trivialist languages); and
  3. there are no other facts to discover here.

But while this view implies that there’s no language-independent fact of the matter whether “Numbers exist” is true, it isn’t happily thought of as implying that there’s no fact of the matter whether platonism is true (or whether abstract objects exist); for on this view, sentences like “Numbers exist” are trivially true in trivialist languages—and so nothing is required of reality to make these sentences true in those languages.

3. The One Over Many Argument

Section 4 will be concerned with what is widely considered to be the best argument (or kind of argument) for platonism, namely, what we can call the ontological-commitment argument. But first, in the present section, we will consider the One Over Many argument, which goes back to Plato and, prior to the twentieth century, was the most prominent argument for platonism.

(There are, of course, many other arguments for platonism in the literature, aside from these two arguments. For instance, to name just two recent arguments, De Cruz (2016) argues that realism about numbers provides the best explanation of the numerical cognition of human beings and other animals, and Tugby (2022) argues for a platonistic view of properties by showing how fruitful the view is—i.e., by showing how platonism can do theoretical work for us. But this essay covers just the One Over Many argument and the ontological-commitment argument.)

The One Over Many argument can be formulated as follows:

I have in front of me three red objects (a ball, a hat, and a rose). These objects resemble one another. Therefore, they have something in common. What they have in common is clearly a property, namely, redness; therefore, redness exists.

We can think of this argument as an inference to the best explanation. There is a fact that requires explanation, namely, that the three objects resemble each other. The explanation is that they all possess a single property, namely, redness. Thus, platonists argue, if there is no other explanation of this fact (i.e., the fact of resemblance) that is as good as their explanation (i.e., the one that appeals to properties), then we are justified in believing in properties.

Notice that as the argument has been stated here, it is not an argument for a platonistic view of properties; it is an argument for the thesis that properties exist, but not for the thesis that properties are abstract objects. Thus, in order to use this argument to motivate platonism, one would have to supplement it with some reason for thinking that the properties in question here could not be ideas in our heads or immanent properties existing in particular physical objects. There are a number of arguments that one might use here, and in section 4.2, we will discuss one such argument. But there is no need to pursue this here, because there is good reason to think that the One Over Many argument doesn’t succeed anyway—i.e., that it doesn’t provide a good reason for believing in properties of any sort. In other words, the One Over Many argument fails to refute nominalism about properties.

Before proceeding, it is worth pointing out that the One Over Many argument described above can be simplified. As Michael Devitt (1980) points out, the appeal to resemblance, or to multiple things having a given property, is a red herring. On the traditional formulation, nominalists are challenged to account for the following fact: the ball is red and the hat is red. But if nominalists can account for the fact that the ball is red, then presumably, they can simply repeat the same sort of explanation in connection with the hat, and they will have accounted for the fact that both things are red. Thus, the real challenge for the nominalist is to explain simple predicative facts, e.g., the fact that the ball is red, without appealing to properties, e.g., redness. More generally, they need to show how we can account for the truth of sentences of the form “a is F” without appealing to a property of Fness.[3]

(One might also think of the argument as asking not for an explanation of the fact that, say, Mars is red, but rather for an account of what it is about the world that makes the sentence “Mars is red” true. See Peacock 2009 in this regard.)

There is a very well-known nominalist response to the One Over Many argument. The heart of the response is captured by the following remark from Quine (1948: 10):

That the houses and roses and sunsets are all of them red may be taken as ultimate and irreducible, and it may be held that…[the platonist] is no better off, in point of real explanatory power, for all the occult entities which he posits under such names as “redness”.

There are two different ideas here. The first is that nominalists can respond to the One Over Many with an appeal to irreducible facts, or brute facts. The second is that platonists are no better off than such brute-fact nominalists in terms of real explanatory power. Now, Quine didn’t say very much about these two ideas, but both ideas have been developed by Devitt (1980, 2010a), whose exposition we follow here.

The challenge to nominalists is to provide an explanation of facts of a certain kind, namely, predicative facts expressed by sentences of the form “a is F”, e.g., the fact that a given ball is red. Now, whenever we are challenged to provide an explanation of a fact, or alleged fact, we have a number of options. The most obvious response is simply to provide the requested explanation. But we can also argue that the alleged fact isn’t really a fact at all. Or, third, we can argue that the fact in question is a brute fact—i.e., a fact that does not have an explanation. Now, in the present case, nominalists cannot claim that all predicative facts are brute facts, because it is clear that we can explain at least some facts of this sort. For instance, it seems that the fact that a given ball is red can be explained very easily by saying that it is red because it reflects light in such and such a way, and that it reflects light in this way because its surface is structured in thus and so a manner. So nominalists should not claim that all predicative facts are brute facts. But as Devitt points out, there is a more subtle way to appeal to bruteness here, and if Quinean nominalists make use of this, they can block the One Over Many argument.

The Quine-Devitt response to the One Over Many begins with the claim that we can account for the fact that the ball is red, without appealing to the property of redness, by simply using whatever explanation scientists give of this fact. Now, by itself, this explanation will not satisfy advocates of the One Over Many argument. If we explain the fact that the ball is red by pointing out that its surface is structured in some specific way, then advocates of the One Over Many argument will say that we have only moved the problem back a step, because nominalists will now have to account for the fact that the ball’s surface is structured in the given way, and they will have to do this without appealing to the property of being structured in the given way. More generally, the point is this: it is of course true that if nominalists are asked to account for the fact that some object a is F, without appealing to the property of Fness, they can do this by pointing out that (i) a is G and (ii) all Fs are Gs (this is the sort of explanation they will get if they borrow their explanations from scientists); but such explanations only move the problem back a step, for they leave us with the task of having to explain the fact that a is G, and if we want to endorse nominalism, we will have to do this without appealing to the property of Gness.

This is where the appeal to bruteness comes in. Nominalists can say that

  1. we can keep giving explanations of the above sort (i.e., explanations of the sort “a is F because it is G”, or because its parts are Gs, Hs, and Is, or whatever) for as long as we can, and
  2. when explanations of this sort cannot be given, no explanation at all can be given.

The thought here is that at this point, we will have arrived at fundamental facts that do not admit of explanations—e.g., facts about the basic physical natures of elementary particles. When we arrive at facts like this, we will say: “There’s no reason why these particles are this way; they just are”.

This gives us a way of understanding how nominalists can plausibly use an appeal to bruteness to respond to the One Over Many argument. But the appeal to bruteness is only half of the Quinean remark quoted above. What about the other half, i.e., the part about the platonist being no better off than brute-fact nominalists in terms of real explanatory power? To appreciate this claim, let us suppose that we have arrived at a bottom-level fact that Quinean nominalists take to be a brute fact (e.g., the fact that physical particles of some particular kind—say, gluons—are G). Advocates of the One Over Many would say that their view is superior to Quinean nominalism because they can provide an explanation of the fact in question. Now, when they announce this, people who were interested in the question of why gluons are G, and who had been disappointed to hear from scientists and Quineans that this is simply a brute fact, might get very excited and listen eagerly to what advocates of the One Over Many have to say. What they say is this:

Gluons are G because they possess the property of Gness.

This doesn’t seem very helpful. The claim that gluons possess Gness seems to do little more than tell us that gluons have some nature that makes it the case that they are G, and so it seems that no genuine explanation has been given. After all, those who had been interested in learning why gluons are G would not be very satisfied by this so-called “explanation”. Thus, to use Quine’s words, it seems that advocates of the One Over Many are “no better off, in point of real explanatory power” than brute-fact nominalists are.

Nominalists might try to push the argument a bit further here, claiming that the sentence

[P]
Gluons possesses the property of Gness

is just a paraphrase of the sentence

[N]
Gluons are G.

On this view, [P] is equivalent to [N]. That is, it says the very same thing. And neither sentence, according to this view, entails the existence of Gness. We can call this a paraphrase-nominalist view of sentences like [P]. But nominalists needn’t endorse this view. They can also endorse a fictionalist view of sentences like [P]. On this view, [P] and [N] do not, strictly speaking, say the same thing, because [P] talks about the property of Gness and [N] does not. According to this fictionalist view, [P] is strictly speaking untrue, because it talks about the property of Gness, and according to nominalism, there is no such thing as Gness. In short, [P] is strictly speaking untrue, on this view, for the same reason that, e.g., “The tooth fairy is nice” is untrue. But while [P] is not literally true on this view, it is “for-all-practical-purposes true”, or some such thing, because colloquially, it can be used to say what [N] says literally. This idea is often captured by saying that [P] is just a manner of speaking, or a façon de parler. (Notice that the dispute between fictionalism and paraphrase nominalism is best understood as a straightforward empirical dispute about the ordinary-language semantics of sentences like [P]; the question is whether such utterances literally say the same things that the corresponding sentences like [N] say.)

Whichever view nominalists adopt here, they can respond to the One Over Many argument—i.e., to the claim that we can explain [N] by endorsing [P]—in the same way, namely, by pointing out that as an explanation of [N], [P] is completely uninformative. Even if nominalists endorse a fictionalist view according to which [P] is not equivalent to [N], they can still say that the above explanation is uninformative, because it really just says that gluons are G because they possess a nature that makes it the case that they are G.

Having made the point that the platonist explanation of [N] is uninformative, the nominalist’s next move is to appeal to Ockham’s razor to argue that we shouldn’t believe in Gness (or at least that we shouldn’t believe in Gness for any reason that has anything to do with the need to explain things like [N]). Ockham’s razor is a principle that tells us that we should believe in objects of a given kind only if they play a genuine explanatory role. This principle suggests that if Gness does not play a genuine role in an explanation of the fact that gluons are G, then we shouldn’t believe in Gness—or, again, we shouldn’t believe in it for any reason having to do with the need to explain the fact that gluons are G.

The Quinean response to the One Over Many argument is often couched in terms of a criterion of ontological commitment. A criterion of ontological commitment is a principle that tells us when we are committed to believing in objects of a certain kind in virtue of having assented to certain sentences. What the above response to the One Over Many suggests is that we are ontologically committed not by predicates like “is red” and “is a rock”, but by singular terms. (A singular term is just a denoting phrase, i.e., an expression that purports to refer to a specific object, e.g., proper names like “Mars” and “Obama”, certain uses of pronouns like “she”, and on some views, definite descriptions like “the oldest U.S. senator”.) More specifically, the idea here seems to be this: if you think that a sentence of the form “a is F” is true, then you have to accept the existence of the object a, but you do not have to accept the existence of a property of Fness; for instance, if you think that “The ball is red” is true, then you have to believe in the ball, but you do not have to believe in redness; or if you think that “Fido is a dog” is true, then you have to believe in Fido but not in the property of doghood.

Three points need to be made here. First, the above criterion needs to be generalized so that it covers the use of singular terms in other kinds of sentences, e.g., sentences of the form “a is R-related to b”. Second, on the standard view, we are ontologically committed not just by singular terms but also by existential statements—e.g., by sentences like “There are some Fs”, “There is at least one F”, and so on (in first-order logic, such sentences are symbolized as “\(\exists xFx\)”, and the “\(\exists\)” is called an existential quantifier). The standard view here is that if you think that a sentence like this is true, then you are committed to believing in the existence of some Fs (or at least one F) but you do not have to believe in Fness; for instance, if we assent to “There are some dogs”, then we are committed to believing in the existence of some dogs, but we are not thereby committed to believing in the existence of the property of doghood. (Quine actually thought that we are committed only by existential claims and not by singular terms; but this is not a widely held view.) Third and finally, it is usually held that we are ontologically committed by singular terms and existential expressions (or existential quantifiers) only when they appear in sentences that we think are literally true and only when we think the singular term or existential quantifier in question can’t be paraphrased away. We can see what’s meant by this by returning to the sentence

[R]
The ball possesses the property of redness.

In this sentence, the expression “the property of redness” seems to be a singular term—it seems to denote the property of redness; thus, using the above criterion of ontological commitment, if we think [R] is true, then it would seem, we are committed to believing in the property of redness. But there are two different responses that nominalists can make to this. First, they can endorse paraphrase nominalism (defined a few paragraphs back) with respect to [R]. If they do this, they will claim that [R] doesn’t really carry an ontological commitment to the property of redness, because it is really just equivalent to the sentence “The ball is red”. This idea is often expressed by saying that in [R], the singular term “the property of redness” can be paraphrased away—which is just to say that [R] can be paraphrased by (or is equivalent to) a sentence that doesn’t contain the singular term “the property of redness” (namely, “The ball is red”). The second view that nominalists can endorse with respect to [R] is fictionalism. In other words, they can admit that [R] does commit to the existence of the property of redness, but they can maintain that because of this (and because there are no such things as properties), [R] is, strictly speaking, untrue, even if it is “for-all-practical-purposes true”, or some such thing.

Having said all of this, we can summarize by saying that the standard view of ontological commitment is as follows:

The Standard Criterion of Ontological Commitment: We are ontologically committed by the singular terms (that can’t be paraphrased away) in the (simple) sentences that we take to be literally true; and we are ontologically committed by the existential quantifiers (that can’t be paraphrased away) in the (existential) sentences that we take to be literally true; but we are not committed by the predicates in such sentences. Thus, for instance, if we believe that a sentence of the form “a is F” is literally true, and if we think that it cannot be paraphrased into some other sentence that avoids reference to a, then we are committed to believing in the object a but not the property of Fness; and, likewise, if we assent to a sentence of the form “a is R-related to b”, then we are committed to believing in the objects a and b but not the relation R; and if we assent to a sentence of the form “There is an F” then we are committed to believing in an object that is F but we are not committed to the property of Fness.[4]

The One Over Many argument is now widely considered to be a bad argument. Ironically, though, the standard criterion of ontological commitment—which Quinean nominalists appeal to in responding to the One Over Many argument—is one of the central premises in what is now thought to be the best argument (or the best kind of argument) for platonism. We can call arguments of this kind ontological-commitment arguments.

4. Ontological-Commitment Arguments for Platonism

Very roughly, an ontological-commitment argument for platonism is an argument that proceeds by locating an ordinary sentence S and claiming that

  1. S is true, and
  2. S has a logical form that makes it the case that it has an ontological commitment to certain objects—or certain kinds of objects—that could only be abstract objects.

The three most important logical forms here—i.e., the three logical forms that feature most often in these arguments—are

  1. “a is F” (as in, e.g., “3 is prime”), and
  2. “a is R-related to b” (as in, e.g., “4 is greater than 3”), and
  3. “There are some Fs” (as in, e.g., “There are some prime numbers between 10 and 20”).

Ontological-commitment arguments for platonism are arguably already present in the works of Plato, but the first really clear formulation of an ontological-commitment argument was given by Frege (see, e.g., his 1884, 1892, 1893/1903, 1918/19).

We will begin, in section 4.1, by constructing an ontological-commitment argument for the existence of numbers. After that, we will discuss ontological-commitment arguments for the existence of propositions, properties, relations, sentence types, possible worlds, logical objects, and fictional objects.

4.1 Mathematical Objects

Here’s an ontological-commitment argument for a platonistic view of numbers:

[1]
The sentence “3 is prime” is true.
[2]
The sentence “3 is prime” should be read at face value; that is, it should be read as being of the form “a is F” and, hence, as making straightforward claims about the nature of a certain object—namely, the number 3. But
[3]
If [1] and [2] are both true, then the number 3 exists. (This follows from the standard criterion of ontological commitment that was articulated in section 3.) Therefore,
[4]
The number 3 exists. But
[5]
If the number 3 exists, then all of the natural numbers exist. And
[6]
If the natural numbers exist, then they’re either abstract objects, or physical objects, or mental objects. But
[7]
The natural numbers aren’t physical objects. And
[8]
The natural numbers aren’t mental objects. Therefore, from [4]–[8], it follows that
[9]
The natural numbers exist, and they are abstract objects. But
[10]
If [9] is true, then platonism is true. Therefore,
[11]
Platonism is true.

The first clear statement of an argument of this general kind was given by Frege (1884); other advocates include Quine (see his 1948 and 1951, though he doesn’t explicitly state the argument there), Gödel (1947), C. Parsons (1965, 1971, 1994), Putnam (1972), Steiner (1975), Resnik (1981, 1997), Zalta (1983, 1999), Wright (1983), Burgess (1983), Hale (1987), Shapiro (1989, 1997), the early Maddy (1990),[5] Katz (1998), Colyvan (2001), McEvoy (2005, 2012), and Marcus (2015).

This version of the argument is formulated much more carefully—using more premises—than is usual in the literature. The reason for this is to isolate all of the separate claims that the argument rests on, and to lay bare the reasoning behind the argument. The argument is clearly valid, and so the only question is whether the basic premises (i.e., [1]–[3], [5]–[8], and [10]) are true. But [5] and [6] are both trivially true, and I don’t know of anyone who would deny either of them, so we can assume that they’re true.[6] So that leaves six basic premises, namely, [1]–[3], [7]–[8], and [10]. But, prima facie, all six of those premises seem extremely plausible, if not downright obvious, and so the argument in [1]–[11] has considerable force.

The nice thing about the way this argument is formulated is that there are six main varieties of anti-platonism in the literature, and each of these six views involves a rejection of a different premise in the argument in [1]–[11]. In the remainder of this section, I’ll discuss these six different responses to the argument.

4.1.1 Psychologism and the Rejection of Premise [8]

Advocates of psychologism reject premise [8] and claim that the natural numbers are mental objects—and, more generally, that our mathematical theories are theories of mental objects.

Frege (1884: introduction and §27; 1893/1903: introduction; 1894; and 1918/19) gave several compelling arguments against psychologism. First, it seems that psychologism is incapable of accounting for the truth of sentences that are about all natural numbers, because there are infinitely many natural numbers and clearly, there could not be infinitely many number-ideas in human minds. Second, psychologism seems to entail that sentences about very large numbers (in particular, numbers that no one has ever had a thought about) are not true; for if none of us has ever had a thought about some very large number, then psychologism entails that there is no such number and, hence, that no sentence about that number could be true. Third, psychologism turns mathematics into a branch of psychology, and it makes mathematical truths contingent upon psychological truths, so that, for instance, if we all died, “4 is greater than 2” would suddenly become untrue. But this seems wrong: it seems that mathematics is true independently of us; that is, it seems that the question of whether 4 is greater than 2 has nothing at all to do with the question of how many humans are alive. Fourth and finally, psychologism suggests that the proper methodology for mathematics is that of empirical psychology; that is, it seems that if psychologism were true, then the proper way to discover whether, say, there is a prime number between 10,000,000 and 10,000,020, would be to do an empirical study of humans and ascertain whether there is, in fact, an idea of such a number in one of our heads; but of course, this is not the proper methodology for mathematics. As Frege says (1884: §27), “Weird and wonderful…are the results of taking seriously the suggestion that number is an idea”.

Platonists do not deny that we have ideas of mathematical objects. What they deny is that our mathematical sentences are about these ideas. Thus, the dispute between platonism and psychologism is at least partly a semantic one. Advocates of psychologism agree with platonists that in the sentence “3 is prime”, “3” functions as a singular term (i.e., as a denoting expression). But they disagree about the referent of this expression. They think that “3” refers to a mental object, in particular, an idea in our heads. It is this semantic thesis that platonists reject and that the above Fregean arguments are supposed to refute. More specifically, they’re supposed to show that the psychologistic semantics of mathematical discourse is not correct because it has consequences that fly in the face of the actual usage of mathematical language.

Once we appreciate the fact that psychologism involves a semantic thesis, the view starts to seem implausible in the extreme. To appreciate this, imagine someone rejecting Euclid’s theorem that there are infinitely many prime numbers on the grounds that there are only finitely many human ideas in the universe, and so there couldn’t be infinitely many numbers, let alone prime numbers. Anyone who objected in this way could be accused of not understanding what “There are infinitely many prime numbers” means in our language. In our language, this sentence is simply not a claim about things that exist in our heads. And so psychologism is just false—it involves an empirically false theory of what mathematical sentences actually mean in ordinary English.

You might think that the above arguments target an implausible version of psychologism; more specifically, you might think that advocates of psychologism could say not that our mathematical theories are about actual mental things that really exist in really human heads, but rather that our mathematical theories are claims about what sorts of ideas it would be possible to construct in our heads. But now we have to ask what a possible idea is. Assuming that we don’t endorse a Lewisian (1986) modal realism according to which every possible idea really exists in a real human head in some real possible world, then it would seem that either

  1. possible ideas are abstract objects of some kind (thus, making this possible-idea view a version of platonism, rather than psychologism), or
  2. there are really no such things as possible ideas (thus, making this view a version of nominalism—in particular, this view would involve a rejection of premise [2], rather than premise [8]).

4.1.2 Physicalism/Immanent Realism and the Rejection of Premise [7]

A similar argument can be run against the view that numbers are physical object and, hence, that premise [7] is false. Imagine someone rejecting Euclid’s theorem that there are infinitely many prime numbers on the grounds that there are only finitely many physical objects in the universe, and so there couldn’t be infinitely many numbers, let alone prime numbers. Regardless of whether this person is correct in their claim that there are only finitely many physical objects in the universe, they are deeply confused about what the sentence “There are infinitely many prime numbers” means in our language. In ordinary English, the truth of “There are infinitely many prime numbers” doesn’t depend on the claim that there are infinitely many physical objects because, in our language, that sentence isn’t about physical objects. And so, like psychologism, this physicalistic view of mathematics is clearly false—because it involves an obviously false empirical theory of what mathematical sentences like “There are infinitely many prime numbers” mean in ordinary English.

Now, once again, you might think that this argument targets the wrong kind of physicalistic view. Consider, e.g., Mill’s (1843: book II, chapters 5 and 6) view that sentences about numbers are really just general claims about bunches of ordinary objects. More specifically, on this view, the sentence “2 + 1 = 3”, for instance, isn’t really about specific objects (the numbers 1, 2, and 3). Rather, it says that whenever we add one object to a pile of two objects, we will get a pile of three objects. You might complain that the argument of the preceding paragraph doesn’t undermine Mill’s version of physicalism because Mill’s view doesn’t entail that there are infinitely many physical objects.

But while Mill’s view clearly has physicalistic leanings, it doesn’t really involve a rejection of premise [7]. It is better thought of as involving a rejection of premise [2]—because it rejects the face-value reading of sentences like “2 + 1 = 3”. But as we’ll see in section 4.1.4, if anti-platonists are going to reject premise [2], there are better ways to do it. One problem with Mill’s view is that it is not easily generalizable to other branches of mathematics. For instance, it’s hard to see how Mill’s view could be extended to set theory. Now, it might seem that we could do this by taking set theory to be about bunches of ordinary objects, or piles of physical stuff. This, however, is untenable. For the principles of set theory entail that corresponding to every physical object, there is a huge infinity of sets. Corresponding to the ball on my table, for instance, there is the set containing the ball, the set containing that set, the set containing that set, and so on; and there is the set containing the ball and the set containing the set containing the ball; and so on and on and on. Clearly, these sets are not just piles of physical stuff, because (a) there are infinitely many of them (again, this follows from the principles of set theory) and (b) all of these infinitely many sets share the same physical base. Thus, it seems that claims about sets are not claims about bunches of ordinary objects, or even generalized claims about such bunches. They are claims about sets, which are objects of a different kind.

Another problem with physicalistic views along the lines of Mill’s is that they seem incapable of accounting for the sheer size of the infinities involved in set theory. Standard set theory entails not just that there are infinitely large sets, but that there are infinitely many sizes of infinity, which get larger and larger with no end, and that there actually exist sets of all of these different sizes of infinity. There is simply no plausible way to take this theory to be about physical stuff.

These arguments do not refute the kind of immanent realism defended by the early Maddy (1990). On Maddy’s view, sets of physical objects are located in spacetime, right where their members are. Thus, if you have two eggs in your hand, then you also have the set containing those eggs in your hand. Maddy’s view has no problem accounting for the massive infinities in mathematics, for on her view, corresponding to every physical object, there is a huge infinity of sets that exist in space and time, right where the given physical object exists. Given this, it should be clear that while Maddy’s view says that sets exist in spacetime, it cannot be thought of as saying that sets are physical objects. So Maddy’s view is not a physicalist view in the sense that’s relevant here (as was pointed out above, it is better thought of as a non-standard version of platonism). Thus, in the present context (i.e., the context in which platonists are trying to undermine views that take mathematical objects to be physical objects), platonists do not need to argue against Maddy’s view. Of course, in the end, if they want to motivate the standard version of platonism, then they’ll have to give reasons for preferring their view to Maddy’s non-standard version of platonism, and this might prove hard to do. For some arguments against Maddy’s early view, see, e.g., Lavine (1992), Dieterle and Shapiro (1993), Milne (1994), Riskin (1994), Carson (1996), and the later Maddy (1997).

(Similar remarks can be made in connection with other immanent realist views, e.g., Armstrong’s (1978) view, but we won’t pursue this here.)

If the arguments of this subsection and the preceding one are cogent, then sentences like “3 is prime” are not about physical or mental objects, and so numbers aren’t physical or mental objects, and premises [7] and [8] are true. But if this is right, then if we want to resist platonism, we’re going to have to defend a nominalistic philosophy of mathematics. There are four different nominalistic views that we need to consider; these four views correspond to the rejection of premises [1]–[3] and [10].

4.1.3 Fictionalism/Error Theory and the Rejection of Premise [1]

One way for nominalists to respond to the argument in [1]–[11] is to reject premise [1] and endorse an error theory—or, as it’s also often called, a fictionalist view—of mathematical discourse. We can define this view as follows:

Mathematical Error Theory (aka, Mathematical Fictionalism):

  1. The platonist’s face-value semantics of mathematical discourse is correct (i.e., sentences like “3 is prime” do purport to be about abstract objects); but
  2. there are no such things as abstract objects; and so
  3. these sentences (and, indeed, our mathematical theories) are not true.

Thus, on this view, just as Alice in Wonderland is not true because there are no such things as talking rabbits, hookah-smoking caterpillars, and so on, so too our mathematical theories are not true because there are no such things as numbers and sets and so on.[7] (Fictionalist views have been developed by numerous philosophers, as we will see in discussing the objections to fictionalism and the responses to those objections that fictionalists have mounted.)

There are a few different ways that platonists might try to argue against fictionalism. The most famous and widely discussed argument against fictionalism is the Quine-Putnam indispensability argument (see Quine 1948, 1951; Putnam 1972, 2012; and Colyvan 2001). This argument (or at any rate, one version of it) proceeds as follows: it cannot be that mathematics is untrue, as fictionalists suggest, because

  1. mathematics is an indispensable part of our physical theories (e.g., quantum mechanics, general relativity theory, evolutionary theory, and so on) and so
  2. if we want to maintain that our physical theories are true (and surely we do—we don’t want our disbelief in abstract objects to force us to be anti-realists about natural science), then we have to maintain that our mathematical theories are true.

Fictionalists have developed two different responses to the Quine-Putnam argument. The hard-road response, developed by Field (1980, 1989) and Balaguer (1998a), is based on the claim that mathematics is, in fact, not indispensable to empirical science—i.e., that our empirical theories can be nominalized, or reformulated in a way that avoids reference to abstract objects. The easy-road response, developed by Balaguer (1998a), Rosen (2001), Yablo (2001, 2002, 2005), Bueno (2009), Leng (2005a, 2010), and perhaps Melia (2000), is to grant the indispensability of mathematics to empirical science and to simply account for the relevant applications from a fictionalist point of view. (A counterresponse to the easy-road response has been given by Colyvan (2002), Baker (2005, 2009), and Baron (2020), who argue that fictionalists can’t account for the explanatory role that mathematics plays in science; responses to the explanatory version of the indispensability argument have been given by Melia (2002), Leng (2005b), Bangu (2008), Daly and Langford (2009), Martínez-Vidal and Rivas-de-Castro (2020), and Boyce (2021).)

A second objection that one might raise against fictionalism is that it’s incompatible with the objectivity of mathematics. In response to this, Field (1980, 1989, 1998) argues that fictionalists can account for the objectivity of mathematics by appealing to objective facts about which mathematical sentences are true in the story of mathematics, where (somewhat roughly) a sentence is true in the story of mathematics if and only if it follows from the axioms of our mathematical theories. And Balaguer (2009, 2021) responds by appealing to objective facts about which mathematical sentences are for-all-practical-purposes true (or FAPP-true), where (somewhat roughly) a sentence is FAPP-true if and only if it would have been true if platonism had been true).

A third objection to fictionalism is based on Lewis’s (1991: 59) claim that it would be laughably presumptuous to suggest that we should reject our mathematical theories for philosophical reasons, given the track records of the two disciplines. Balaguer (2021) responds to this by claiming that fictionalists aren’t suggesting that we should reject our mathematical theories, or that there’s something wrong with these theories; on the contrary, on this version of fictionalism, there’s nothing wrong with our mathematical theories because (a) they’re FAPP-true, and (b) the mark of goodness in mathematics is FAPP-truth, not literal truth.

A fourth objection that one might raise against fictionalism is that it’s not a nominalistically acceptable view because it involves tacit reference to various kinds of abstract objects, e.g., sentence types, or stories, or possible worlds. For responses to this objection, see, e.g., Field (1989) and Rosen (2001).

For other objections to fictionalism, see, e.g., Malament (1982), Shapiro (1983a), Resnik (1985), Chihara (1990: chapter 8, section 5), Horwich (1991), O’Leary-Hawthorne (1994), Burgess and Rosen (1997), Katz (1998), Thomas (2000, 2002), Stanley (2001), Bueno (2003), Szabó (2005), Hoffman (2004), and Burgess (2004). For responses to these objections, see the various fictionalist works cited above, as well as Daly (2008) and Liggins (2010). And for a discussion of all these objections, as well as fictionalist responses to them, see the entry on fictionalism in the philosophy of mathematics.

Prima facie, it might have seemed obvious that our mathematical theories are true—and, hence, that fictionalism is false. But on reflection, it’s not clear that we have any good argument for the claim that our mathematical theories are strictly and literally true. Nonetheless, nominalists might not want to give up on the truth of mathematics. If so, then they’ll have to reject either [2], or [3], or [10] in the argument in [1]–[11].

4.1.4 Paraphrase Nominalism and the Rejection of Premise [2]

One very traditional way to respond to the argument in [1]–[11] is to reject premise [2] and endorse a paraphrase nominalist view. According to views of this kind, sentences like “3 is prime” are true, but they should not be read as platonists read them; on the contrary, these sentences should be interpreted as being equivalent to other sentences—what are called paraphrases of these sentences—that do not involve ontological commitments to abstract objects. One view of this sort, known as if-thenism, holds that, e.g., “3 is prime” can be paraphrased by—i.e., is equivalent to—the sentence “If there were numbers, then 3 would be prime”. (For an early version of this sort of view, see the early Hilbert [1899 and his letters to Frege in Frege 1980]; for later versions, see Putnam 1967a, 1967b and Hellman 1989.) A second version of the paraphrase strategy, which we can call metamathematical formalism (see Curry 1951), is that “3 is prime” can be paraphrased by “‘3 is prime’ follows from the axioms of arithmetic”.[8] A third paraphrase view holds that sentences that seem to be about numbers are best read as being about plurals. For instance, we might read “2 + 2 = 4” as really saying something like this: two objects and two (more) objects are four objects. (Views of this general kind have been defended by, e.g., Yi 2002, 2016; Hofweber 2005; and Moltmann 2013a.) (For a fourth version of paraphrase nominalism, see Rayo 2008.)

One problem with the various paraphrase views (not to put too fine a point on it) is that none of the paraphrases seems very good. That is, the paraphrases seem to misrepresent what we actually mean when we say things like “3 is prime” (and by “we”, I mean both mathematicians and ordinary folk). What we mean, it seems, is that 3 is prime—not that if there were numbers, then 3 would be prime, or that the sentence “3 is prime” follows from the axioms of arithmetic, or any such thing. And notice how the situation here differs from cases where we do seem to have good paraphrases. For instance, one might try to claim that if we endorse the sentence

[A1]
The average accountant has two children,

then we are ontologically committed to the existence of the average accountant; but it is plausible to suppose that, in fact, we are not so committed, because [A1] can be paraphrased by the sentence

[A2]
On average, accountants have two children.

Moreover, it seems plausible to maintain that this is a good paraphrase of [A1] because it seems clear that when people say things like [A1], what they really mean are things like [A2]. But in the present case, this seems wrong: it does not seem plausible to suppose that when ordinary people utter “3 is prime”, what they really mean is that if there were numbers, then 3 would be prime. Again, it seems that what we mean here is, very simply, that 3 is prime. In short, when people say things like “3 is prime”, they do not usually have any intention to be saying anything other than what these sentences seem to say; and because of this, it seems that the platonist’s face-value semantics for mathematical discourse is correct.

If we focus on sentences like “2 + 2 = 4”, then the Yi-Hofweber-Moltmann view—i.e., the view that these sentences are about plurals—might seem to fit better with ordinary usage. But when we switch to sentences like “3 is prime”—and, even worse, “There are infinitely many primes”—they start to seem cumbersome and less plausible.

You might think that paraphrase nominalists don’t need to commit to the thesis that their paraphrases capture the real ordinary-language meanings of our mathematical sentences. One way to develop this idea would be to maintain that the so-called “paraphrases” of our mathematical claims should be thought of as replacements for those claims—i.e., as the claims that we should make when we’re being careful to say exactly what we mean, or some such thing. Philosophers who endorse replacement views of this general kind include Chihara (1990, 2004), Dorr (2008), Boyce (2020), and Himelright (2023a)—and perhaps some of the paraphrase nominalists listed above.

It is of course true that we can endorse a replacement view of this kind. But it’s important to note that if “paraphrase nominalism” is defined in terms of an acceptance of premise [1] and a rejection of premise [2]—i.e., if paraphrase nominalism is supposed to give nominalists a way to salvage the truth of mathematics—then replacement nominalism is not a version of paraphrase nominalism. It is, rather, a version of fictionalism, or error theory. For if replacement nominalists don’t claim that their “paraphrases” capture the real ordinary-language meanings of our mathematical sentences, then they’ll presumably be granting that platonists are right about the ordinary-language meanings of mathematical sentences like “3 is prime”. But if so—if replacement nominalists admit that ordinary utterances of “3 is prime” are best interpreted as being about abstract mathematical objects, or as purporting to be about such objects—then since replacement nominalists don’t believe in the existence of abstract objects, they’ll have to admit that such sentences are not literally true, and so their view will collapse into a version of mathematical fictionalism, or error theory. So replacement theorists would not be saving the truth of our mathematical theories. And given this, their so-called “paraphrases” would be best thought of as giving them a way of accounting for the objectivity of mathematics, and the goodness of mathematics; and so these paraphrases would be playing roughly the same role in replacement nominalism that Field’s truth in the story of mathematics (or Balaguer’s FAPP-truth) plays in mathematical error theory.

(For a good in-depth discussion and critique of some of the paraphrase-nominalist views, see Burgess and Rosen 1997.)

4.1.5 Thin-Truth-ism and the Rejection of Premise [3]

A third nominalist strategy is to reject premise [3] and the standard criterion of ontological commitment. The most obvious way to do this is to endorse the following view:

  1. simple mathematical sentences like “3 is prime” should be read as being of the form “a is F” and as being about abstract objects (e.g., “3” should be taken as denoting the number 3, which could only be an abstract object, and “3 is prime” should be taken as being a claim about that object); and
  2. abstract objects—in particular, mathematical objects like the number 3—don’t exist (and the claim here is that they don’t have any sort of being whatsoever, so this is not a Meinongian view); but
  3. sentences like “3 is prime” are still literally true.

Thus, on this view, a claim about an object a can be true even if that object doesn’t exist at all. Let’s call this view thin-truth-ism. Views of this general kind have been endorsed by Azzouni (1994, 2004), Salmon (1998), and Bueno (2005).

Thin-truth-ists endorse a similar view of existence claims. For instance, on their view, the sentence “There are infinitely many prime numbers” is literally true, even though there are no such things as numbers. This might look like a contradiction, but it’s not, because according to thin-truth-ism, existential expressions (or quantifiers) like ‘there is’ are ambiguous.

Most philosophers find this view extremely hard to believe. Indeed, a lot of philosophers would say that it’s simply confused, or incoherent. But, in fact, thin-truth-ism is not incoherent. A better way to formulate the problem with the view is as follows: in giving up on the standard criterion of ontological commitment, thin-truth-ists seem to be using “true” in a non-standard way. Most of us would say that if there is no such thing as the number 3, and if “3 is prime” is read at face value (i.e., as being about the number 3), then it follows trivially that “3 is prime” could not be true. Or more generally, most of us would say that if there is no such thing as the object a, then sentences of the form “a is F” cannot be literally true. This, of course, is just to say that most of us accept the standard criterion of ontological commitment articulated in section 3; but the point here is that this criterion seems to be built into the standard meaning of words like “true”. Indeed, this explains why the standard criterion of ontological commitment is so widely accepted.

Here’s a quick argument for thinking that thin-truth-ists are using “true” in a non-standard way:

  1. sentences like “Mars doesn’t exist at all, but it’s red” seem contradictory to us (ordinary speakers of English); but
  2. thin-truth-ism implies that they’re not contradictory; and so
  3. thin-truth-ism is out of step with ordinary usage.

Another worry one might raise about thin-truth-ism is that it only differs from fictionalism in a merely verbal way. Let “thin-true” express the kind of truth that thin-truth-ists have in mind, and let “thick-true” express the kind of truth that everyone else in the debate has in mind (i.e., platonists, fictionalists, paraphrase nominalists, and so on). Given this, fictionalists and thin-truth-ists will both endorse all of the following claims:

  1. platonists are right that “3 is prime” is a claim about the number 3; and
  2. there is no such thing as the number 3; so
  3. “3 is prime” isn’t thick-true; but despite this,
  4. “3 is prime” is thin-true.

Now, of course, thin-truth-ists and fictionalists will disagree about whether “3 is prime” is true, but this will collapse into a disagreement about whether thin-truth or thick-truth is real truth, and this is just a disagreement about what the word “true” means in ordinary folk English, and it’s hard to see why an empirical question about how the folk happen to use some word is relevant to the debate about the existence of mathematical objects.

(Meinongians would also reject premise [3]; but Meinongianism is not happily thought of as a version of nominalism. Indeed, as we saw in section 2, it seems that Meinongianism is a non-standard version of platonism; for it implies that there are numbers and that they are non-physical, non-mental, non-spatiotemporal, and so on.)

4.1.6 Carnapian Conventionalism and the Rejection of Premise [10]

A final version of anti-platonism, which we can call conventionalism, involves the rejection of premise [10]. According to this view, sentences like “3 exists”, and “There are numbers” are true because they’re analytic—i.e., because they follow from the semantic rules of the language. In essence, according to this view, we’ve just collectively stipulated—through our use of mathematical sentences like “There are some prime numbers between 10 and 20”—that these sentences are to be true. Thus, nothing is required of reality to make these sentences true, and so it doesn’t follow from the truth of “There are numbers” that there are abstract objects that actually exist in reality. Views of this general kind have been endorsed by Carnap (1950), Rayo (2013), Warren (2020), and perhaps Hale and Wright (2009). Jenkins (2008) also endorses a view in this general vicinity, although her view is a bit different.

It can be hard to pin down the difference between this view and fictionalism. Warren seems to think that the difference boils down to a metasemantic disagreement. In particular, borrowing some lingo from Warren, we can say that whereas fictionalists endorse a bottom-up metasemantics (i.e., a view that says that semantic facts about sentences are determined by semantic facts about (a) words and (b) compositional semantic rules), conventionalists endorse a top-down metasemantics (i.e., a view that says that semantic facts about subsentential expressions are determined by semantic facts about sentences). More specifically, on a Warren-style top-down metasemantics, the principle of charity (which tells us to interpret people, as far as possible, as endorsing truths) more or less dictates that sentences like “3 is prime” are true.

The standard view since Quine (1948), in analytic philosophy, is that conventionalist views of the kind under discussion here aren’t true because sentences of the form “a is F” and “There are some Fs”—aren’t analytic. The reason these sentences aren’t analytic according to this view is that

  1. the standard criterion of ontological commitment articulated in section 3 is true, and so sentences of the form “a is F” and “There are some Fs” can’t be true unless objects of the relevant kinds actually exist in reality; and
  2. we can’t define objects into existence.

4.2 Properties and Relations

We can construct an ontological-commitment argument for a platonistic view of properties and relations—analogous to the argument in [1]–[11]—by locating some ordinary sentences that seem to be both true and about properties and/or relations. We will focus on sentences about properties, but exactly parallel remarks could be made about relations. You might begin here by considering sentences like the following:

[P1]
Mars possesses the property of redness.

But, prima facie, it seems that we can plausibly take [P1] to be equivalent to the following:

[P2]
Mars is red.

And if [P1] is equivalent to [P2], then we can endorse a paraphrase-nominalist view of [P1] by pointing out that, according to the standard criterion of ontological commitment, [P2] doesn’t commit us to the existence of a property. But there are other sentences about properties that don’t seem so easily paraphrased—e.g., sentences like

[P3]
There’s at least one property that Mars and Venus both possess.

It’s at least initially plausible to suppose that [P3] is true, and that it commits to the existence of a property, and that properties are abstract objects. If we wanted to, we could construct an argument here—an argument for a platonistic view of properties that began with the claim that [P3] is true—that exactly paralleled the argument in [1]–[11], i.e., the argument for a platonistic view of numbers articulated in section 4.1. We won’t bother to do this here, but it’s important to note that ontological-commitment arguments for the existence of properties rely on premises that are exactly analogous to the premises in the argument in [1]–[11]. And this means that all the same avenues of response are available to anti-platonists—and, hence, that platonists would need to undermine all of the various anti-platonist views.

For example, platonists would need to undermine conceptualism—the view that properties are mental objects that exist in our heads, rather than abstract objects. Many of the arguments listed in section 4.1.1 against psychologistic views of numbers also tell against the conceptualistic view of properties and relations. For instance, as Russell (1912: chapter IX) points out, property claims and relational claims seem to be objective; e.g., the fact that Mount Everest is taller than Mont Blanc is a fact that holds independently of us; but conceptualism about universals entails that if we all died, it would no longer be true that Mount Everest bears the taller than relation to Mont Blanc, because that relation would no longer exist. And, second, conceptualism seems simply to get the semantics of our property discourse wrong, for it seems to confuse properties with our ideas of them. The English sentence “Red is a color” does not seem to be about anybody’s idea of redness; it seems to be about redness, the actual color, which, it seems, is something objective.

Second, platonists would need to undermine the immanent realist view that properties exist in the objects that instantiate them—either as universals (so that, e.g., there is one property of roundness that exists in Mars and Venus and so on), or as tropes (so that, e.g., there is a roundness-trope that exists in Mars, and a different roundness-trope, and so on). There are many different arguments that platonists might run against immanent realist views of properties. For example, they might argue that (a) immanent realism is incompatible with the existence of uninstantiated properties, and (b) we need to countenance the existence of such properties. One reason to think that we need to endorse the existence of uninstantiated properties is that we need them to be the semantic contents of uninstantiated predicates; e.g., you might think that we need to endorse the existence of the property being a witch to account for the meaningfulness of sentences like “There are no witches”—and for the truth of sentences like “Jane believes that the property of being a witch is uninstantiated”.

Third, platonists would need to respond to paraphrase nominalist views. There are a few different recent nominalization programs worth considering here. First, Moltmann (2013b) argues that words that seem to refer to universals (e.g., “redness”) actually refer plurally to all the possible tropes of the given kind; so, e.g., on this view, “redness” refers plurally to all possible redness tropes. One problem with this view is that it commits to the existence of possible objects; but if these aren’t abstract objects, then they’re presumably Lewisian possible objects; and one might reasonably want to avoid committing to the existence of Lewisian possible objects.

Another paraphrase-type view, endorsed by Himelright (2021), is to paraphrase sentences like [P3] with counterfactual sentences like the following:

[P3a]
If the entire plenitude of Lewisian worlds had existed, then it would have been the case that there was at least one one-place-predicate token that applied to both Mars and Venus.

One problem with [P3a] is that it clearly doesn’t capture the actual ordinary-language meaning of [P3]. Himelright acknowledges this and offers [P3a] as a replacement—in the sense of section 4.1.4. But given this, Himelright’s view isn’t really a paraphrase view; it is rather a fictionalist/error-theoretic view according to which [P3] is literally false. In particular, it isn’t all that different from Balaguer’s (2021) error-theoretic view, according to which sentences like [P3] are false but for-all-practical-purposes true, where a sentence is for-all-practical-purposes true if and only if it would have been true if the entire plenitudinous realm of properties had existed.

A final paraphrase-type view of our talk of properties and relations can be given in a higher-order logical language. For example, we could paraphrase [P3] with the following sentence:

[P3b]
\(\exists X(Xm \amp Xv)\),

where “m” denotes Mars, “v” denotes Venus, “\(\exists\)” is a second-order quantifier that quantifies over predicate positions, and “X” is a second-order variable. Now, on one way of indicating what [P3b] means—and until recently, this was the standard reading of such sentences—[P3b] is no help to anti-platonists because it commits to the existence of properties. But in recent years, higher-order metaphysicians have pointed out that we don’t have to interpret higher-order sentences like [P3b] as being about properties. Rather, we can just learn higher-order languages on their own terms, without translating them into English, and we can take [P3b] as saying something that isn’t about properties at all. It’s simply a higher-order way of generalizing from [P3]. (Dorr forthcoming develops an argument for a view of this kind, but see also Bacon 2024 and Fritz & Jones 2024b.) The most interesting version of the higher-order view, in my opinion, is the view that commits to the idea that the higher-order sentences in question are true paraphrases, capturing the actual meanings of ordinary-language claims about properties, as opposed to replacements. But the paraphrase version of the view is a controversial empirical claim, and it’s not clear that there’s very good evidence for it.

Another view that employs higher-order resources, developed by Trueman (2024) and Button and Trueman (2024), combines a fictionalist/error-theoretic view of universals with a realist view of properties, where

  1. universals are (or are supposed to be) objects of a kind that are picked out by words like “wisdom” and “redness”, and
  2. properties aren’t objects at all and are, rather, higher-type entities picked out by expressions like “…is wise” and “…is red”.

It might seem that this view is just a non-standard version of platonism—because it might seem that properties of this kind could only be abstract entities. And this is especially true if we endorse the existence of uninstantiated properties, as Button and Trueman do. Now, higher-order-ists of the Button-Trueman kind could respond here by claiming that the idea that these properties are abstract is unintelligible—because if we tried to articulate this idea, we’d end up saying things like “Is red is abstract”, which isn’t even grammatical. But there might be ways to press the issue here and force higher-order-ists to choose between

  1. a non-standard version of platonism according to which properties are non-physical, non-mental entities, and
  2. a nominalistic view according to which properties don’t really exist in an “out-there-in-reality” kind of way.

4.3 Propositions

We turn now to ontological-commitment arguments for the existence of propositions. To construct an argument of this kind, we need to find some sentences that involve ontological commitments to propositions. Probably the most widely discussed sentences here are belief ascriptions, i.e., sentences like the following:

[O]
Obama believes that snow is white.

The idea, then, is to argue for a platonistic view of propositions by arguing that

  1. sentences like [O] are true, and
  2. they involve ontological commitments to propositions, and
  3. propositions are abstract objects.

(The most important figure in the development of arguments of this kind is Frege [1892, 1918/19]. Other relevant figures [who wouldn’t all endorse an argument of this kind] include Russell [1905, 1911], Church [1950, 1954], Quine [1956], Kaplan [1968, 1989], Kripke [1972, 1979], Schiffer [1977, 1987, 1994], Perry [1979], Evans [1981], Peacocke [1981], Barwise and Perry [1983], Bealer [1982, 1993], Zalta [1983, 1988], Katz [1986], Salmon [1986], Soames [1987, 2014], Forbes [1987], Crimmins and Perry [1989], Richard [1990], Crimmins [1998], Recanati [1993, 2000], King [1995, 2014], Braun [1998], and Saul [1999].)

Why think that sentences like [O] involve ontological commitments to propositions? Well, the first point to note here is that these sentences contain “that”-clauses—where a “that”-clause is simply the word “that” added to the front of a complete sentence, as in, e.g., “that snow is white”. And the second point to note is that, in English, “that”-clauses are singular terms. A common way to illustrate this second point—see, e.g., Bealer (1982 and 1993) and Schiffer (1994)—is to appeal to arguments like the following:

I.
Obama believes that snow is white.
Therefore, Obama believes something (namely, that snow is white).

This argument seems to be valid, and platonists claim that the best and only tenable explanation of this fact involves a commitment to the idea that the “that”-clause in this argument—i.e., “that snow is white”—is a singular term. So, returning to [O], the idea here is that the logical form of [O] is “o is B-related to t”, where “B” expresses a two-place belief relation, “o” denotes Obama, and “t” denotes the thing that Obama is being said to believe—namely, that snow is white. And so if [O] is true (and it sure seems to be), then according to the standard criterion of ontological commitment, the thing that Obama is being said to believe—namely, that snow is white—has to actually exist.

But what kinds of object is this? What kinds of objects do our “that”-clauses refer to? It might seem that they refer to facts, or to states of affairs. For instance, it might seem that “that snow is white” refers to the fact that snow is white. This, however, is a mistake (at least in connection with the “that”-clauses that appear in belief reports). For since beliefs can be false, it follows that the “that”-clauses in our belief reports refer to things that can be false. For example, if Sammy is seven years old, then the sentence “Sammy believes that snow is powdered sugar” could be true; but if this sentence is true, then its “that”-clause refers to doesn’t refer to a fact, because (obviously) there is no such thing as the fact that snow is powdered sugar.

These considerations suggest that the referents of the “that”-clauses that appear in belief ascriptions are things that can be true or false. But if this is right, then it seems that the objects of belief—i.e., the things that the “that”-clauses in our belief sentences refer to—are either sentences or propositions. The standard platonist view is that they are propositions. Before we consider their arguments for this claim, we need to say a few words about the different kinds of sentential views that one might endorse.

To begin with, we need to distinguish between sentence types and sentence tokens. To appreciate the difference, consider the following indented sentences:

Cats are cute.
Cats are cute.

We have here two different tokens of a single sentence type. Thus, a token is an actual physical thing, located at a specific place in spacetime; it is a pile of ink on a page (structured in an appropriate way), or a sound wave, or a collection of pixels on a computer screen, or something of this sort. A type, on the other hand, can be tokened numerous times but is not identical with any single token. Thus, a sentence type is an abstract object. And so if we are looking for an anti-platonist view of what “that”-clauses refer to, or what belief reports are about, we cannot say that they’re about sentence types; we have to say they’re about sentence tokens.

A second distinction that needs to be drawn here is between sentence tokens that are external, or public, and sentence tokens that are internal, or private. Examples of external sentence tokens were given in the last paragraph—piles of ink, sound waves, and so on. An internal sentence token, on the other hand, exists inside a particular person’s head. There is a wide-spread view—due mainly to Jerry Fodor (1975 and 1987) but adopted by many others, e.g., Stich (1983)—that we are able to perform cognitive tasks (e.g., think, remember information, and have beliefs) only because we are capable of storing information in our heads in a neural language (often called mentalese, or the language of thought). In connection with beliefs, the idea here is that to believe that, say, snow is white, is to have a neural sentence stored in your head (in a belief way, as opposed to a desire way, or some other way) that means in mentalese that snow is white.

This gives us two different anti-platonist alternatives to the view that belief reports involve references to propositions. First, there is the conceptualistic (or mentalistic) view that belief reports involve references to sentences in our heads, or mentalese sentence tokens. And, second, there is the physicalistic view that belief reports involve references to external sentence tokens, i.e., to piles of ink, and so on (versions of this view have been endorsed by Carnap (1947), Davidson (1967), and Leeds (1979)).

There are a number of arguments that suggest that ordinary belief reports cannot be taken to be about (internal or external) sentences and that we have to take them to be about propositions. We will rehearse one such argument here, an argument that goes back at least to Church (1950). Suppose that Boris and Jerry both live in cold climates and are very familiar with snow. Thus, they both believe that snow is white. But Boris lives in Russia and speaks only Russian, whereas Jerry lives in Minnesota and speaks only English. Now, consider the following argument:

II.
Boris believes that snow is white.
Jerry believes that snow is white.
Therefore, there’s at least one thing that Boris and Jerry both believe, namely, that snow is white.

This argument seems clearly valid; but this seems to rule out the idea that the belief reports here are about sentence tokens. For (a) in order to account for the validity of the argument, we have to take the two “that”-clauses to refer to the same thing, and (b) there is no sentence token that they could both refer to. First of all, they couldn’t refer to any external sentence token (or, for that matter, any sentence type associated with any natural language), because

  1. if the first “that”-clause refers to such a sentence, it would presumably be a Russian sentence, since Boris speaks only Russian;[9] and
  2. if the second “that”-clause refers to such a sentence, it would presumably be an English sentence, since Jerry speaks only English; and so
  3. the two “that”-clauses cannot both refer to the same external sentence token (or natural-language sentence type).

And second, they cannot refer to any mentalese sentence token, because

  1. if the first “that”-clause refers to such a sentence, it would presumably be in Boris’s head; and
  2. if the second “that”-clause refers to such a sentence, it would presumably be in Jerry’s head; and so
  3. the two “that”-clauses cannot both refer to the same mentalese sentence token.

Therefore, it seems to follow that the “that”-clauses in the above argument do not refer to sentence tokens of any kind. And since these are ordinary belief ascriptions, it follows that, in general, the “that”-clauses that appear in ordinary belief ascriptions do not refer to sentence tokens.

Now, as it’s formulated here, this argument doesn’t rule out the view that “that”-clauses refer to mentalese sentence types, but the argument can be extended to rule out that view as well (e.g., one might do this by talking not of an American and a Russian but of two creatures with different internal languages of thought). We won’t run through the details of this here, since, as we’ve seen, anti-platonists can’t claim that “that”-clauses refer to types anyway, because types are abstract objects. But if we assume that that version of the argument is cogent as well, then it follows that “that”-clauses don’t refer to sentences of any kind at all and, so it seems that they must refer to propositions.[10]

It’s important to note that the issue so far has been purely semantic. What the above argument suggests is that regardless of whether there are any such things as propositions, our “that”-clauses are best interpreted as referring (or purporting to refer) to such objects. Platonists then claim that if this is correct, then there must be such things as propositions, because, clearly, many of our belief ascriptions are true. For instance, “Obama believes that snow is white” is true; thus, if the above analysis of “that”-clauses is correct, and if the standard criterion of ontological commitment is correct, it follows that there is such a thing as the proposition that snow is white.

Finally, it seems that propositions could only be abstract objects. Indeed, the above arguments against the idea that “that”-clauses refer to sentences already seems to rule out physicalistic and psychologistic views of propositions.

So that is how the ontological-commitment argument for a platonistic view of propositions proceeds.

How might anti-platonists respond to this argument? Given the implausibility of physicalistic and psychologistic views of propositions, it seems that the only hope for anti-platonists is to develop a nominalistic views. One way to do this would be to develop a fictionalistic/error-theoretic view. Balaguer (1998b) develops a view of this kind that mirrors his fictionalistic view of mathematics. On this view, sentences like [O] are strictly speaking false (because their “that”-clause are supposed to refer to propositions, and there are no such things as propositions) but they’re for-all-practical-purposes true because they would have been true if the entire plenitude of propositions existed.

A second way for nominalists to proceed would be to develop a paraphrase view. The paraphrase views of mathematical discourse don’t carry over very well to the case of propositions, but some of the paraphrase views of properties seem more applicable. Perhaps most notably, the higher-order views of properties discussed in section 4.2 seems to carry over seamlessly to the case of propositions. E.g., Dorr’s (forthcoming) paraphrase view seems to work in the same way; for just as we can quantify over predicate positions without claiming that we’re quantifying over properties, so too we can quantify over sentence positions without claiming that we’re quantifying over propositions.

Finally, the Moltmann (2013b) view of properties discussed in section 4.2 carries over to the case of propositions as well, and so does the Button-Trueman view of properties discussed in section 4.2 (see Trueman 2020 and Button & Trueman 2024).

4.4 Sentence Types

Linguistics is a branch of science that tells us things about sentences. For instance, it says things like

[A]
“The cat is on the mat” is a well-formed sentence of English,

and

[B]
“Visiting relatives can be boring” is structurally ambiguous.

The quoted sentences that appear in [A] and [B] are singular terms; e.g., “‘The cat is on the mat’” refers to the sentence “The cat is on the mat”, and [A] says of this sentence that it has a certain property, namely, that of being a well-formed English sentence. Thus, sentences like [A] commit to the existence of sentences. And so if [A] is true, then sentences exist.

Now, one might hold a physicalistic view here according to which linguistics is about actual (external) sentence tokens, e.g., piles of ink and verbal sound waves. (This view was popular in the early part of the twentieth century—see, e.g., Bloomfield 1933, Harris 1954, and Quine 1953.) Or alternatively, one might hold a conceptualistic view, maintaining that linguistics is essentially a branch of psychology; the main proponent of this view is Noam Chomsky (1965: chapter 1), who thinks of a grammar for a natural language as being about an ideal speaker-hearer’s knowledge of the given language, but see also Sapir (1921), Stich (1972), and Fodor (1981). But there are reasons for thinking that neither the physicalist nor the conceptualist approach is tenable and that the only plausible way to interpret linguistic theory is as being about sentence types, which of course, are abstract objects (proponents of the platonistic view include Katz [1981], Soames [1985], and Langendoen & Postal [1984]). Katz constructs arguments here that are very similar to the argument for a platonistic view of numbers discussed in section 4.1). One argument here is that linguistic theory seems to have consequences that are (a) true and (b) about sentences that have never been tokened (internally or externally), e.g., sentences like “Green umbrellas slithered unwittingly toward Arizona’s favorite toaster”. (Of course, now that we’ve written this sentence down, it has been tokened, but it seems likely that before we wrote it down here, it had never been tokened.) Standard linguistic theory entails that many sentences that have never been tokened (internally or externally) are well-formed English sentences. Thus, if we want to claim that our linguistic theories are true, then we have to accept these consequences, or theorems, of linguistic theory. But these theorems are clearly not true of any sentence tokens (because the sentences in question have never been tokened) and so, it is argued, they must be true of sentence types.

4.5 Possible Worlds

It is a very widely held view among contemporary philosophers that we need to appeal to entities known as possible worlds in order to account for various phenomena. There are dozens of phenomena that philosophers have thought should be explained in terms of possible worlds, but to name just one, it is often argued that semantic theory is best carried out in terms of possible worlds. Consider, for example, the attempt to state the truth conditions of sentences of the form “It is necessary that S” and “It is possible that S” (where S is any sentence). It is widely believed that the best theory here is that a sentence of the form “It is necessary that S” is true if and only if S is true in all possible worlds, and a sentence of the form “It is possible that S” is true if and only if S is true in at least one possible world. Now, if we add to this theory the premise that at least one sentence of the form “It is possible that S” is true—and this seems undeniable—then we are led to the result that possible worlds exist.

Now, as was the case with numbers, properties, and sentences, not everyone who endorses possible worlds thinks that they are abstract objects; indeed, one leading proponent of the use of possible worlds in philosophy and semantics—namely, David Lewis (1986)—maintains that possible worlds are of the same kind as the actual world, and so he takes them to be concrete objects. However, most philosophers who endorse possible worlds take them to be abstract objects (see, e.g., Plantinga 1974, 1976; Adams 1974; Chisholm 1976; and Pollock 1984). It is important to note, however, that possible worlds are very often not taken to constitute a new kind of abstract object. For instance, it is very popular to maintain that a possible world is just a set of propositions. (To see how a set of propositions could serve as a possible world, notice that if you believed in full-blown possible worlds—worlds that are just like the actual world in kind—then you would say that corresponding to each of these worlds, there is a set of propositions that completely and accurately describes the given world, or is true of that world. Many philosophers who don’t believe in full-blown possible worlds maintain that these sets of propositions are good enough—i.e., that we can take them to be possible worlds.) Or alternatively, one might think of a possible world as a state of affairs, or as a way things could be. In so doing, one might think of these as constituting a new kind of abstract object, or one might think of them as properties—giant, complex properties that the entire universe may or may not possess. For instance, one might say that the actual universe possesses the property of being such that snow is white and grass is green and San Francisco is north of Los Angeles, and so on.

In any event, if possible worlds are indeed abstract objects, and if the above argument for the existence of possible worlds is cogent, then this would give us another argument for platonism.

4.6 Logical Objects

Frege (1884, 1893/1903) appealed to sentences like the following:

[D]
The number of Fs is identical to the number of Gs if and only if there is a one-to-one correspondence between the Fs and the Gs.
[E]
The direction of line a is identical to the direction of line b if and only if a is parallel to b.
[F]
The shape of figure a is identical to the shape of figure b if and only if a is geometrically similar to b.

On Frege’s view, principles like these are true, and so they commit us to the existence of numbers, lines, and shapes. Now, of course, we have already gone through a platonistic argument—indeed, a Fregean argument—for the existence of numbers. Moreover, the standard platonist view is that the argument for the existence of mathematical objects is entirely general, covering all branches of mathematics, including geometry, so that on this view, we already have reason to believe in lines and shapes, as well as numbers. But it is worth noting that in contrast to most contemporary platonists, Frege thought of numbers, lines, and shapes as logical objects, because on his view, these things can be identified with extensions of concepts. What is the extension of a concept? Well, simplifying a bit, it is just the set of things falling under the given concept. Thus, for instance, the extension of the concept white is just the set of white things.[11] And so the idea here is that since logic is centrally concerned with predicates and their corresponding concepts, and since extensions are tied to concepts, we can think of extensions as logical objects. Thus, since Frege thinks that numbers, lines, and shapes can be identified with extensions, on his view, we can think of these things as logical objects.

Frege’s definitions of numbers, lines, and shapes in terms of extensions can be formulated as follows:

  1. the number of Fs is the extension of the concept equinumerous with F (that is, it is the set of all concepts that have exactly as many objects falling under them as does F); and
  2. the direction of line a is the extension of the concept parallel to a; and
  3. the shape of figure a is the extension of the concept geometrically similar to a.

A similar approach can be used to define other kinds of logical objects. For instance, the truth value of the proposition p can be identified with the extension of the concept equivalent to p (i.e., the concept true if and only if p is true).

It should be noted that contemporary neo-Fregeans reject the identification of directions and shapes and so on with extensions of concepts. They hold instead that directions and shapes are sui generis abstract objects.

For contemporary work on this issue, see, e.g., Wright (1983), Boolos (1987), and Anderson and Zalta (2004).

4.7 Fictional Objects

Finally, a number of philosophers (see, most notably, van Inwagen [1977], Wolterstorff [1980], and Zalta [1983, 1988]) think that fictional objects, or fictional characters, are best thought of as abstract objects. (Salmon [1998], Thomasson [1999], and Voltolini [2020] also take fictional objects to be abstract, but their views are a bit different; they maintain that abstract fictional objects are created by humans.) To see why one might be drawn to this view, consider the following sentence:

[G]
Sherlock Holmes is a detective.

Now, if this sentence actually appeared in one of the Holmes stories by Arthur Conan Doyle, then that token of it would not be true—it would be a bit of fiction. But if you were telling a child about these stories, and the child asked, “What does Holmes do for a living?”, and you answered by uttering [G], then it seems plausible to suppose that what you have said is true. But if it is true, then it seems that its singular term, “Sherlock Holmes”, must refer to something. What it refers to, according to the view in question, is an abstract object, in particular, a fictional character. In short, present-day utterances of [G] are true statements about a fictional character; but if Doyle had put [G] into one his stories, it would not have been true, and its singular term would not have referred to anything.

There is a worry about this view that can be put in the following way: if there is such a thing as Sherlock Holmes, then it has arms and legs; but if Sherlock Holmes is an abstract object, as this view supposes, then it does not have arms and legs (because abstract objects are non-physical); therefore, it cannot be the case that Sherlock Holmes exists and is an abstract object, for this leads to contradiction. Various solutions to this problem have been proposed. For instance, Zalta argues that in addition to exemplifying certain properties, abstract objects also encode properties. The fictional character Sherlock Holmes encodes the properties of being a detective, being male, being English, having arms and legs, and so on. But it does not exemplify any of these properties. It exemplifies the properties of being abstract, being a fictional character, having been thought of first by Arthur Conan Doyle, and so on. Zalta maintains that in English, the copula “is”—as in “a is F”—is ambiguous; it can be read as ascribing either property exemplification or property encoding. When we say “Sherlock Holmes is a detective”, we are saying that Holmes encodes the property of being a detective; and when we say “Sherlock Holmes is a fictional character”, we are saying that Holmes exemplifies the property of being a fictional character. (It should be noted that Zalta employs the device of encoding with respect to all abstract objects—mathematical objects, logical objects, and so on—not just fictional objects. Also, Zalta points out that his theory of encoding is based on a similar theory developed by Ernst Mally [1912].)

Those who endorse a platonistic view of fictional objects maintain that there is no good paraphrase of sentences like [G], but one might question this. For instance, one might maintain that [G] can be paraphrased by a sentence like this:

“Sherlock Holmes is a detective” is true-in-the-Holmes-stories.

If we read [G] in this way, then it is not about Sherlock Holmes at all; rather, it is about the Sherlock Holmes stories. Thus, in order to believe [G], so interpreted, one would have to believe in the existence of these stories. Now, one might try to take an anti-platonistic view of the nature of stories, but there are problems with such views, and so we might end up with a platonistic view here anyway—a view that takes sentences like [G] to be about stories and stories to be abstract objects of some sort, e.g., ordered sets of propositions.[12] Which of these platonistic views is superior can be settled by determining which (if either) captures the correct interpretation of sentences like [G]—i.e., by determining whether ordinary people who utter sentences like [G] are best interpreted as talking about stories or fictional characters.

It should be noted that some people who take fictional characters to be abstract objects (e.g., Thomasson 1999) would actually agree with the idea that [G] should be read in the above way—i.e., as a claim about the Sherlock Holmes stories and not about Sherlock Holmes himself. Thomasson’s main argument for believing in fictional characters is based not on sentences like [G] but rather on sentences like the following:

[H]
Some 19th century heroines are better developed than any 18th century heroines.

It’s hard to see how to paraphrase this as being about a story, or even a bunch of stories. But, of course, one could still endorse a fictionalist (i.e., an error-theoretic) view of sentences like [H]. In other words, one could admit that [H] is a claim about fictional characters and then one could claim that since there are no such things as fictional characters, [H] is simply not true, although of course it might be true-in-the-story-of-fictional-characters, or for-all-practical-purposes true, where this just means that it would have been true if there had been a realm of fictional characters of the sort that platonists believe in. (Brock [2002] endorses a fictionalist view of fictional characters that’s similar in spirit to the view alluded to here.)

5. The Epistemological Argument Against Platonism

In this section, we will consider what is widely considered the strongest argument against platonism, namely, the epistemological argument.

(Before discussing the epistemological argument, it’s worth noting that there are many other important arguments against platonism. Perhaps most obviously, there is an argument against platonism based on Ockham’s razor—an argument that goes back to William of Ockham himself. In the second half of the twentieth century, the multiple-reductions argument developed by Benacerraf [1965] received a lot of attention. And even more recently, anti-platonist arguments have been developed by Builes [2022], Himelright [2023b], and Goodman [2024].)

The epistemological argument goes all the way back to Plato, but it has received renewed interest since 1973, when Paul Benacerraf presented a version of the argument. Most of the work on this problem has taken place in the philosophy of mathematics, in connection with the platonistic view of mathematical objects like numbers. We will therefore discuss the argument in this context, but all of the issues and arguments can be reproduced in connection with other kinds of abstract objects. The argument can be put in the following way:

[B1]
Human beings exist entirely within spacetime.
[B2]
If there exist any abstract mathematical objects, then they do not exist in spacetime. Therefore, it seems very plausible that:
[B3]
If [B1] and [B2] are true, then if there exist any abstract mathematical objects, then human beings could not attain knowledge of them. Therefore,
[B4]
If there exist any abstract mathematical objects, then human beings could not attain knowledge of them. Therefore,
[B5]
If mathematical platonism is true, then human beings could not attain mathematical knowledge. But
[B6]
Human beings have mathematical knowledge. Therefore,
[B7]
Mathematical platonism is not true.

(Before discussing possible responses to the argument, it’s worth noting that there’s a sizable literature on how exactly the epistemological argument should be formulated. Field [1989] famously articulated the argument as a challenge to explain the reliability of our mathematical beliefs. Donaldson [2014] argues that Field’s version of the argument shouldn’t be understood in terms of our mathematical beliefs counterfactually depending on the mathematical facts. Benacerraf’s original version of the argument relied on a causal theory of knowledge; that reliance has been almost universally rejected; but Nutting [2016] provides a causal version of the epistemological argument that doesn’t rely on a causal theory of knowledge. Finally, worries about the epistemological argument are raised by Linnebo [2006] and Clarke-Doane [2016, 2020a], and a response is given in Berry 2020.)

There seem to be only three ways for platonists to respond to this argument—they have to reject [B1], [B2], or [B3]. For there is no reasonable way for them to reject—and they presumably wouldn’t want to reject—[B6] or any of the three inferences in the argument. Also, it’s not enough for platonists to simply reject one of these three premises and leave it at that. The epistemological argument is best thought of as a challenge to explain how we humans could acquire knowledge of abstract objects; and it seems that a satisfying response to the argument would have to deliver such an explanation.

The first way for platonists to respond to the epistemological argument is to reject [B1] and to argue that the human mind is capable of somehow forging contact with abstract mathematical objects and thereby acquiring information about such objects. This strategy has been pursued by Plato in The Meno and The Phaedo, and by Gödel (1947). Plato’s idea is that our immaterial souls acquired knowledge of abstract objects before we were born and that mathematical learning is really just a process of coming to remember what we knew before we were born. On Gödel’s version of the view, we acquire knowledge of abstract objects in much the same way that we acquire knowledge of concrete physical objects; more specifically, just as we acquire information about physical objects via the faculty of sense perception, so we acquire information about abstract objects by means of a faculty of mathematical intuition. Now, other philosophers have endorsed the idea that we possess a faculty of mathematical intuition, but Gödel’s version of this view—and he seems to be alone in this—involves the idea that the mind is non-physical in some sense and that we are capable of forging contact with, and acquiring information from, non-physical mathematical objects.[13] This view has been almost universally rejected. One problem is that denying [B1] doesn’t seem to help. The idea of an immaterial mind receiving information from an abstract object seems just as mysterious and confused as the idea of a physical brain receiving information from an abstract object.

The second strategy that platonists can pursue in responding to the epistemological argument is to argue that [B2] is false and that human beings can acquire information about mathematical objects via normal perceptual means. The early Maddy (1990) pursued this idea in connection with set theory, claiming that sets of physical objects can be taken to exist in spacetime and, hence, that we can perceive them. For instance, on her view, if there are two books on a table, then the set containing these books exists on the table, in the same place that the books exist, and we can see the set and acquire information about it in this way. This view has been subjected to much criticism, including arguments from the later Maddy (1997). Others to attack the view include Lavine (1992), Dieterle and Shapiro (1993), Milne (1994), Riskin (1994), and Carson (1996).

It may be objected that according to the definitions we’ve been using, views like Maddy’s are not versions of platonism at all, because they do not take mathematical objects to exist outside of spacetime. Nonetheless, there is some rationale for thinking of Maddy’s view as a sort of non-traditional platonism. For since Maddy’s view entails that there is an infinity of sets associated with every ordinary physical object, all sharing the same spatiotemporal location and the same physical matter, she has to allow that these sets differ from one another in some sort of non-physical way and, hence, that there is something about these sets that is non-physical, or perhaps abstract, in some sense of these terms. Now, of course, the question of whether Maddy’s view counts as a version of platonism is purely terminological; but whatever we say about this, the view is still worth considering in the present context, because it is widely thought of as one of the available responses to the epistemological argument against platonism, and indeed, that is the spirit in which Maddy originally presented the view.

The third and final strategy that platonists can pursue is to reject [B3]. This has been the most popular strategy among contemporary platonists. Its advocates include Quine (1951: §6), Steiner (1975: chapter 4), C. Parsons (1980, 1994), Katz (1981, 1998), Resnik (1982, 1997), Wright (1983), Lewis (1986: §2.4), Hale (1987), Shapiro (1989, 1997), Burgess (1990), Balaguer (1995), Linsky and Zalta (1995), Burgess and Rosen (1997), and Linnebo (2006).

The strategy of rejecting [B3] presumably goes hand-in-hand with an assumption that [B1] and [B2] are true—and, hence, that mathematical objects (if there are such things) are totally inaccessible to us and that information cannot pass from mathematical objects to human beings. So the idea behind this third strategy is to grant that human beings do not have any information-transferring contact with abstract objects, and to attempt to explain how human beings could nonetheless acquire knowledge of such objects. Now, platonists might try to claim—and Collard (2007) does claim—that even if [B1] and [B2] are true, there could still be an information-transferring contact between abstract objects and human beings, because it could be that abstract objects are not causally inert. But in order for this response to be at all satisfying, it would need to come with an explanation of how abstract objects could cause us to believe things, and no one has ever come close to giving such an explanation.

(Bengson [2015] has proposed a view according to which our mathematical intuitions are constituted by the abstract objects that they’re about. It’s not clear whether he thinks that this involves an information transfer between abstract objects and human beings, but either way, this view seems to be undermined by the fact that we don’t have any explanation of how it could be that our intuitions are constituted by abstract objects in a way that makes it the case that our intuitions are reliable indicators of the facts about the relevant abstract objects.)

In any event, most of the philosophers who have rejected [B3] have been happy to grant that human beings do not have any information-transferring contact with such objects; their aim has been to explain how we could acquire knowledge of abstract objects without the aid of any such contact. We will briefly consider the most prominent of these attempted explanations.

One version of the reject-[B3] strategy, implicit in the writings of Quine (1951: §6) and developed by Steiner (1975: chapter four, especially section IV) and Resnik (1997: chapter 7), is to argue that we have good reason to believe that our mathematical theories are true, even though we don’t have any contact with mathematical objects, because

  1. these theories are embedded in our empirical theories, and
  2. these empirical theories (including their mathematical parts) have been confirmed by empirical evidence, and so
  3. we have empirical evidence for believing that our mathematical theories are true and, hence, that abstract mathematical objects exist.

Notice that this view involves the controversial thesis that confirmation is holistic, i.e., that entire theories are confirmed by pieces of evidence that seem to confirm only parts of theories. One might doubt that confirmation is holistic in this way (see, e.g., Sober 1993, Maddy 1992, and Balaguer 1998a). Moreover, even if one grants that confirmation is holistic, one might worry that this view leaves unexplained the fact that mathematicians are capable of acquiring knowledge of their theories before these theories are applied in empirical science.

A second version of the reject-[B3] strategy, developed by Katz (1981, 1998) and Lewis (1986: §2.4), is to argue that we can know that our mathematical theories are true, without any sort of information-transferring contact with mathematical objects, because these theories are necessarily true. The reason we need information-transferring contact with ordinary physical objects in order to know what they’re like is that these objects could have been different. For instance, we have to look at fire engines in order to know that they’re red, because they could have been blue. But we don’t need any contact with the number 4 in order to know that it is the sum of 3 and 1, because it is necessarily the sum of 3 and 1. (For criticisms of this view, see Field [1989: 233–38] and Balaguer [1998a: chapter 2, section 6.4].)

A third version of the reject-[B3] strategy has been developed by Resnik (1997) and Shapiro (1997). Both of these philosophers endorse (platonistic) structuralism, a view that holds that our mathematical theories provide true descriptions of mathematical structures, which, according to this view, are abstract. Moreover, Resnik and Shapiro both claim that human beings can acquire knowledge of mathematical structures (without coming into any sort of information-transferring contact with such things) by simply constructing mathematical axiom systems; for, they argue, axiom systems provide implicit definitions of structures. One problem with this view, however, is that it does not explain how we could know which of the various axiom systems that we might formulate actually pick out structures that exist in the mathematical realm.

A fourth and final version of the reject-[B3] strategy, developed independently (and somewhat differently) by Balaguer (1995, 1998a) and Linsky & Zalta (1995), is based on the adoption of a particular version of platonism called plenitudinous platonism (Balaguer also calls it full-blooded platonism, or FBP, and Linsky and Zalta call it principled platonism). Balaguer defines plenitudinous platonism (somewhat roughly) as the view that there exist mathematical objects of all possible kinds, or the view that all the mathematical objects that possibly could exist actually do exist. But, in general, Balaguer would define a different plenitude principle for every different kind of abstract object. Linsky & Zalta develop plenitudinous platonism by proposing a distinctive plenitude principle for each of three basic domains of abstracta: abstract individuals, relations (properties and propositions), and contingently nonconcrete individuals (1995: 554). For example, on their view, the plenitude principle for abstract individuals asserts (again, somewhat roughly) that every possible description of an object characterizes an abstract object that encodes—and, thus, in an important sense, has—the properties expressed in the description.

Balaguer and Linsky & Zalta then argue that if platonists endorse plenitudinous platonism, they can solve the epistemological problem with platonism without positing any sort of information-transferring contact between human beings and abstract objects. Balaguer’s version of the argument proceeds as follows. Since plenitudinous platonism, or FBP, says that there are mathematical objects of all possible kinds, it follows that if FBP is true, then every purely mathematical theory that could possibly be true (i.e., that’s internally consistent) accurately describes some collection of actually existing mathematical objects. Thus, it follows from FBP that in order to attain knowledge of abstract mathematical objects, all we have to do is come up with an internally consistent purely mathematical theory (and know that it is consistent). But it seems clear that (i) we humans are capable of formulating internally consistent mathematical theories (and of knowing that they are internally consistent), and (ii) being able to do this does not require us to have any sort of information-transferring contact with the abstract objects that the theories in question are about.[14] Thus, if this is right, then the epistemological problem with platonism has been solved.

One might object here that in order for humans to acquire knowledge of abstract objects in this way, they would first need to know that plenitudinous platonism is true. Linsky & Zalta respond to this by arguing that plenitudinous platonism (or in their lingo, principled platonism) is knowable a priori because it is required for our understanding of any possible scientific theory: it alone is capable of accounting for the mathematics that could be used in empirical science no matter what the physical world was like. Balaguer’s response, on the other hand, is based on the claim that to demand that platonists explain how humans could know that FBP is true is exactly analogous to demanding that external-world realists (i.e., those who believe that there is a real physical world, existing independently of us and our thinking) explain how human beings could know that there is an external world of a kind that gives rise to accurate sense perceptions. Thus, Balaguer argues that while there may be some sort of Cartesian-style skeptical argument against FBP here (analogous to skeptical arguments against external-world realism), the argument in [B1]–[B7] is supposed to be a different kind of argument, and in order to respond to that argument, FBP-ists do not have to explain how humans could know that FBP is true.[15]

The FBP-based response to the epistemological argument has probably been the most widely accepted response in the literature. But some pushback against this response has been given by McSweeney (2020) and Clarke-Doane (2020b).

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