Relational Quantum Mechanics

First published Mon Feb 4, 2002; substantive revision Tue Feb 4, 2025

Relational Quantum Mechanics (RQM) is the most recent among the interpretations of quantum mechanics that are widely discussed today. It was introduced in 1996, with quantum gravity as a remote motivation (Rovelli 1996); interests has grown since, first very slowly, but steadily, and has peaked during the last years (see Calosi and Riedel 2024, also for a good account of the historical evolution of the interpretation).

RQM does not interpret the confusion about quantum theory as a sign that what is necessary to render the theory intelligible is a new equation (as in De Broglie-Bohm theory), some not-yet observed phenomena (as in the physical collapse hypotheses), or the assumuption of the existence of an unaccessible domain of reality (as the Many Worlds’s universal quantum state.) Rather, it interprets quantum phenomena as an invitation to a radical update of the conceptual framework we use to think about reality.

RQM is a refinement of the textbook interpretation, where some aspects of the role played by the “Copenhagen observer” (but not all of them) are not limited to the classical world, but can rather be played by any physical system. The interpretation rejects an ontic construal of the quantum state: the quantum state play only an auxiliary role, akin to the Hamilton-Jacobi function of classical mechanics. It is instead based on an ontology of physical systems and physical variables, as is classical mechanics. The difference with classical mechanics is double (a) variables only take value at discrete interactions and (b) the value a variable takes is only relative to the (other) system affected by the interaction. Here “relative” is in the sense in which in classical mechanics velocity is a property of a system relative to another system. These relative events occur at discrete times, and consist of physical variables taking on precise relative values; these variables may lack any value at all in intermediate times. At least in some readings, as discussed below, this leads to a radical perspectival antifoundationism. The technical basis of RQM is the following

Main Assumption: The probability distribution for (future) values of variables relative to a system \(S\) depend on (past) values of variables relative to the same system \(S\), but not on (past) values of variables relative to another system \(S'\).

The interpretation does not require, for its formulation, the assumption of a classical world. Measurement does not play any fundamental role, and it does not require certain special systems to be counted as ‘observers’. Instead, it assumes that any physical system can play the role that the Copenhagen’s observer assumes in bringing about values of variables at a given time. This is possible without changing the predictions of quantum theory, thanks to the Main Assumption, because the interference observed by a system \(S\) is not erased by the actualisation of variables relative to a different system \(S'\) (it can of course be suppressed by decoherence). In the Wigner-Friend situation, the interference observed by Wigner is compatible with Friend’s determined observation. In this way, RQM succeeds in making sense of a fully quantum world without requiring hidden variables, many worlds, physical collapse mechanisms, or a special role for mind, agents, or similar.

The price to pay for this parsimony is a weakening of the conventional (“strong”) realism of classical mechanics where physical variables are assumed to have values which are non-relational and exist at every time. The fact that variables take value only at interactions gives a sort of sparse event (or “flash”) ontology; the fact that they are labeled by the system to which they refer, adds a level of indexicality to the representation of the world, and raises philosophical issues.

By itself RQM is metaphysically neutral, but it has a strong relational stance that questions strong realism (Laudisa 2019), in a sense discussed below. Because of this tinkering with realism, RQM has been framed, in turn, in the context of various philosophical perspectives, including constructive empiricism (van Fraassen 2009), neo-Kantism (Bitbol 2007 [Other Internet Resources], Bitbol 2010), anti-monism (Dorato 2016), structural realism (Candiotto 2017), Perspectival realism (Massimi 2022), metaphysical coherentism (Dorato and Morganti 2022) and anti-foundationalist coherentism. (See also Brown 2009, Wood 2010 [Other Internet Resources], and especially the extended discussion in Calosi and Riedel 2024.) The interpretation has many aspects in common with Dennis Dieks’ Perspectival Quantum Realism (Dieks 2022, Bene and Dieks 2002), with QBism (Fuchs 2001, 2002 [Other Internet Resources]), with Healey’s pragmatist approach (Healey 1989, 2023) and with the view of quantum theory discussed by Zeilinger and Bruckner (Zeilinger 1999, Brukner & Zeilinger 2003).

1. Main Ideas

1.1 Values of physical variables

The starting point of RQM is that quantum mechanics is not about a wave function or a quantum state \(\psi\); it is about values of physical variables. The basic ontology assumed by RQM, accordingly, includes only physical systems and variables that take values, as in classical mechanics. For instance, a real fact is the position of a particle having a certain value \(x\) at a certain time \(t\). Facts as this one (“the particle is at \(x\) at time \(t\)”) are called “events”, or “quantum events”. Quantum theory is about such events. There are however two differences between facts in quantum mechanics and facts in classical mechanics. In classical mechanics, there are two general assumptions that are abandoned in RQM:

(a) In classical mechanics it is assumed that all the variables of a system have a value at every time. RQM, on the contrary, assumes that in nature this is in not the case in general (Heisenberg 1925; Kochen & Specker 1967). Physical variables have values only at some times, and have no value at the other times. Events, in other words, are discrete. Variables have values when a system acts on another system. More precisely, for a system \(S\) to have a variable \(A\) taking a value is to interact with a second system \(S'\); the variable \(A\) characterizes the effect of a certain action on \(S'\). In RQM, this is what it means for a variable to have a value. That is, for a system to be described by a variable taking a value is to affect another system in a certain manner, and nothing else. This is the basic intuition that led Heisenberg to find the key to quantum mechanics in 1925; there are questions that make sense in classical mechanics, but have no significance in nature. For instance, the question “What is the \(y\)-component of the spin of an electron when its \(z\)-component is \(\frac{1}{2} \hslash\)?” is meaningless: neither it admits an operational definition, nor is it needed for a realistic understanding of nature.

(b) The second assumption of classical mechanics dropped in RQM is that variables take absolute values, namely values independent from any other systems. Instead, RQM assumes that all (contingent) physical variables are relational. Contingent variables are those represented by phase space functions in classical theory. Any value that these variables take is (implicitly or explicitly) labelled by a second physical system. If the variable \(A\) of a system \(S\) takes a value in the interaction with a second systems \(S'\), the value it takes is relative to \(S'\). The actualisation of an event itself is relative to a system. The concrete meaning of this is the assumption above, according to which future ways the system \(S\) affects \(S'\) depend (probabilistically) on the values that variables of \(S\) have taken with respect to \(S'\), but future ways the system \(S\) affect a third system \(S''\) do not. The ensemble of all events relative to an arbitrary system \(S'\), together with the probabilistic predictions these entail, is called the “perspective” of \(S'\).

Dropping these two assumptions breaks away from a venerable conceptual structure that has long underpinned physics in particular and perhaps our worldview in general: the idea that the world can be though as composed by systems that at any time have variable properties by themselves, irrespectively from any other system, and these properties can be describes by the values taken by variables characteristic of the system in itself.

The claim at the basis of RQM is that “different observers can give different accounts of the same set of events” (Rovelli 1996: 1643). Textbook quantum mechanics is a complete description of the perspective of a single system, but it disregards the effect of this system on the perspective of other systems. RQM emphasises the fact that any observer itself behaves as a quantum system, when acting on other systems. Vincenzo Fano (2024 [Other Internet Resources]) gives a simple illustration of how RQM applies to common apparently paradoxical situation in quantum mechanic. The relation between perspectives is discussed below.

1.2 Relative variables: “Different observers can give different accounts of the same set of events”

Relative variables are variables whose value does not depend on a single system, but rather on two systems. A well known example is the velocity of an object in classical mechanics. The velocity is implicitly or explicitly relative to a second object. There is no “velocity of a single object”, irrespectively on any other object, in classical mechanics. Other well-known examples are the electric potential (only the potential of a conductor with respect to another conductor has physical meaning) and position (only position with respect to some other object has physical meaning). Relational quantum mechanics takes a further long step in this direction, assuming that we can make sense of quantum mechanics by assuming that all physical variables are relational in this sense.

‘Relative’ does not mean subjective. Subjects, or agents play no special role in RQM. When we say that our speed is 11km/second with respect to the Sun, we are not attributing subjectivity to the Sun. When we say that the distance between a signpost and a road intersection is 100 meters, we are not thinking that a road’s intersection is an agent. In a naturalistic perspective, a person, an agent, a subject, are physical systems; the world they relate to is described by the value of the variables with respect to them. A person dwelling on the Earth sees the Cosmos rotating because the Earth is spinning; but the Cosmos rotates with respect to the frame defined by Earth irrespectively from the existence of persons on the Earth. To say that RQM requires subjects or agents is the same mistake as saying that our explanation of the daily rotation of sun moon and stars around the Earth requires to take agency or subjectivity into account: a nonsense. There is nothing subjective, idealistic, or mentalistic, in RQM.

1.3 Observer and measurement

In textbook presentations, quantum mechanics is about measurement outcomes obtained when an “observer” makes a “measurement” on a quantum system. Such measurements are not generic interactions between two systems. They are special kinds of interactions. They require that information is registered and stored. For this to happen, there must be decoherence and dissipation, hence a classical domain. RQM extends the interpretation of the theory to the regimes where decoherence and dissipation are not sufficient to underpin the “observer-measurement” interpretation. When decoherence is sufficient, the values of variables becomes “stable” (Di Biagio and Rovelli 2021): their label become irrelevant and measurments have determined outcomes within that decoherence domain.

According to RQM, therefore, quantum mechanics is not a theory of the dynamics of an entity \(\psi\), from which the world of our experience somehow emerges. It is instead a theory about the standard world of our experience, described by values that conventional physical variables take at interactions, and about the transition probabilities that determine which values are likely to be realized, given that others were. This is compatible with quantum phenomena, if the relative character of variables is taken into account.

1.4 The wave function

In RQM, the quantum state is a mathematical device that refers to two systems, not a single one. It codes the values of the variables of the first that have been actualised in interacting with the second (Groenewold 1957); it therefore codes in particular anything we can predict regarding the future values of these variables, relative to the second system. The state \(\psi\) , in other words, can be interpreted as a compendium of information accessible to a second system, determined by a specific history of interactions. Understood in this manner the quantum state is always and only a relative state in the sense of Everett (1957). In this sense RQM is strongly “Everettian”. It is so in a different sense than the Many Worlds interpretations, which includes a hypothetical universal wave function of which the various relative states \(\psi\) are branches. The universal wave function plays no role in RQM (nor in any physical application of quantum theory.).

Several presentations of quantum theory interpret the wave function of a system, or its quantum state \(\psi\), as properties of the system as such. From the perspective of RQM, this is what generates the confusion about quantum theory (Rovelli 2018). RQM is realist about quantum states in the weak sense that they represent something physically real: for instance, after a procedure that we call “state preparation”, there is a matter of fact about what that preparation was; preparations giving distinct pure quantum states correspond to distinct physical states of affairs. These “states of affaires”, however, are relative to the preparation apparatus, they are not states of the system alone. This, in particular, renders RQM compatible with the ψ-Ontology theorems like the PBR theorem for the reality of the wave function (Pusey, Barrett, & Rudolph 2012; Leifer 2014). The PBR theorem applies to RQM, construed as a theorem about relative states. The peaceful coexistence between between RQM these theorems has been discussed in (Calosi and Oldofredi 2021).

On the other hand, RQM does not make use of the notion of the absolute state of a system or of the idea – common in other interpretations – that the quantum state could represent “all there is” about that system. This “strongly realistic” interpretation of the state is given up in RQM. In this sense, the interpretation of the wave function in the context of RQM is akin the interpretation of the Hamilton-Jacobi functional in classical mechanics: a theoretical tool to facilitate the computation of the probabilities of future events on the basis of certain given knowledge about a certain state of affairs. The relation between the wave function \(\psi\) and the Hamilton-Jacobi functional \(S\) is more than an analogy, because in the semiclassical approximation the later approximates the first \((\psi \sim \exp iS/\hslash)\). This mathematical relation can be taken as an argument against a strongly realistic readings of \(\psi\), for the following reason. The interpretation of a quantity A in the mathematical apparatus of a physical theory must be consisten with the interpretation of the quantity A reduces to in an approximation. The Hamilton-Jacobi functions of, say, a classical particle has no strongly realistic interpretation. The Hamilton-Jacobi function we explicitly use in calculations collapses and jumps with what we learn about the system, as does the quantum wave function.

Voiding the quantum states of its strongly realistic interpretation gives away with the mystery of quantum jumps and collapses. The fact that RQM state is relative to a system explains why it can jump as the two systems act on one another.

In classical mechanics we can dispense of the Hamilton-Jacobi functional. This testifies for its lack of direct ontological weight. We can equally dispense with \(\psi\) in quantum theory. Evidence of this is that the full early development of the quantum mechanical formalisms (Heisenberg 1925; Born & Jordan 1925; Dirac 1925; Born, Heisenberg, & Jordan 1926) predates the work where \(\psi\) was introduced (Schrödinger 1926). Quantum mechanics can be formulated without reference to the quantum state, as a theory of probabilities for sequences of events. The state \(\psi\) is a convenient tool, not a necessary one.

Heilbron and Rovelli (2023) argue that Schrödinger’s development of wave mechanics, in spite of its wide utility, can be seen as conceptually misleading, because it has promoted a mistaken overemphasis of the ontological role of \(\psi\) .

1.5. Quantum superposition: can a cat be half dead, half alive?

If \(\psi'\) and \(\psi''\) are two orthogonal quantum states of a system, quantum mechanics assumes that the system can also be in the state \(\psi = (\psi' +\psi'')/\sqrt{2}\). This is the superposition principle, a cornerstone of the theory (Dirac 1930). If \(\psi'\) is the state of a live cat and \(\psi''\) the state of a dead cat, then \(\psi\) is a state in which the cat is in a quantum superposition of dead and alive; the theory predicts that this is a possible (relative) state of a cat. What does RQM say about situations such as this? Is the cat in some sense half alive and half dead?

The existence of states like \(\psi =(\psi' +\psi'')/\sqrt{2}\)does not mean that we “see superpositions” (as sometimes wrongly stated): what we “see”, namely what we measure, according to textbook quantum theory, are eigenvalues of self-adjoint operators, not quantum states. Measured eigenvalues are always univocal, never “superimposed”. To be a superposition, rather, means two things. First, that if an observable has value \(a'\) in \(\psi'\) and value \(a''\) in \(\psi''\) then any observation of the system will give either \(a'\) or \(a''\), each with probability 1/2. Second, the probability distribution of the outcomes of the measurement of any observable that is not diagonal in the \((\psi'\), \(\psi''\)) basis will be affected by interference: that is, it will not be the mean of the average values of the observable in \(\psi'\) and \(\psi''\). In RQM, this and nothing else is the meaning of being in a quantum superposition.

We never see cats that are half alive and half dead because quantum theory predicts that we never see this sort of things. It predicts that we see cats either alive or dead. It also predicts that in principle we should be able to see interference effect between the two states. These interference effects are strongly suppressed by decoherence in the case of macroscopic systems (like cats), hence the theory actually predicts that they are extremely hard to observe, in agreement with experience. A puzzle, on the other hand, appears if we ask what the cat itself would perceive when we describe it in quantum superposition. Say the brain of the cat measures whether its heart is beating or not. The theory predicts that the brain will find either that it does or that it does not. In textbook quantum mechanics, this implies a collapse of \(\psi\) to either \(\psi'\) or \(\psi''\). In turns, this implies that no further effects of interference between these two states will happen. And this conclusion contradicts the existence of interference effects (although small due to decoherence) predicted by quantum theory. This problem is resolved by RQM. It is solved by the Main Assumption: the way the cat, a quantum system, affects an external system, is not affected by the specific way the heart of the cat has affected its brain.

That is, the state of the cat with respect to the external world does not collapse when a part of the cat interacts with another.

2. Related Issues

2.1 Information

The early presentations of RQM were formulated in the language of information theory. They were at the roots of the later development of the use of information theory to make sense of quantum theory (Calosi and Riedel 2024). The quantum state is a way of coding the information that an observing system \(S'\) may have about a quantum system \(S\), relevant for predicting future ways \(S\) can affect \(S'\). This information is determined by the ways \(S\) has affected \(S'\) in the past. Furthermore, the hope was presented in (Rovelli 1996) that a full reconstruction of the quantum formalism on the basis of simple informational postulates was possible. Two main postulates were proposed:

  • (i) relevant information is finite for a system with compact phase space,
  • (ii) new information can always be acquired.

The two postulates are not in contradiction with each other because when new information is gathered some previously relevant information becomes irrelevant. “Relevant” here means that it affects future probabilities. A moment of reflection shows that first postulate implies the characteristic discreteness of quantum theory, while the second is implied by Heisenberg’s uncertainties. Similar ideas were independently considered by Zeilinger and Bruckner (Zeilinger 1999; Brukner & Zeilinger 2003).

As emphasized in Dorato (2017), information is best not understood as a primary notion. It must be defined physically in terms of something else; as such, it can play an important notion in “theories of principle” in the sense of Einstein (1919). In RQM, the information is defined relationally as relative information (in the sense of Shannon) that a physical system has about another system. Relative information is physical correlation between two systems, namely a measure of the difference between the possible number of states of the combined system and the product of the number of states of the two systems, due to the existence of physical constraints. Thus, we say that a variable \(O_A\) of a system has information about a variable \(A\) of another system iff the values that \(A\) and \(O_A\)can take are correlated. In this case the outcome of a measurment of \(O_A\) predicts the outcome of a measurement of \(A\), that is, in this sense, “\(O_A\)has information about \(A\)”.

In the spirit of Shannon, this is a weak definition of information that has no mentalistic, semantic, or cognitive aspects. The informational perspective of the early work in RQM has influenced the development of numerous later information theoretical approaches to the foundations of quantum theory, as well as a number of later attempts to derive the quantum formalism of the theory from physically transparent postulates. For an idiosycratic and a bit rambling, but with intersting insights, account of the state of this program see (Stacey 2021 [Other Internet Resources]).

2.2 Discreteness

Discreteness is not an accessory aspect of quantum theory: it is its most characteristic feature (it gives the theory its name). Discreteness appears in two related ways in quantum theory.

First, the amount of information that can be gathered regarding the state of a system which is in a finite region R of its phase space is finite. For each degree of freedom, it is given by the Liouville measure of R divided by the Planck constant. This is what causes discrete spectra. Continuous spectra require infinite phase spaces, and can be seen as effects of idealisations. The discreteness of quantum mechanics is therefore expressed by the first of the two informational postulates.

Second, quantum mechanics describes the world in terms of values of variables at specific discrete times. This second aspect of discreteness is directly accounted for by the sparse ontology of RQM. The history of a quantum particle, for instance, is neither a continuous line in spacetime (as in classical mechanics), nor a continuous wave function on spacetime. Rather, with respect to any other system it is a discrete set of interactions, each localized in spacetime.

The discrete ontology of RQM seems to raise a difficulty: what determines the timing for the events to happen? The problem is the difficulty of establishing a specific moment when, say, a measurement happens. The question is addressed in Rovelli (1998), observing that quantum mechanics itself does give a (probabilistic) prediction on when a measurement happens. This is because the meaning of the question whether or not a measurement has happened is to ascertain whether of not a pointer variable \(O_A\) in the observing system \(S\) has become properly correlated with (namely, “has information about”) the variable \(A\) of the system \(A\). In turn, this is a physical question that makes sense because it can be posed empirically by measuring \(A\) and \(O_A\) and checking if they are consistent. On the regress that this determines, see Section 3.3 below.

2.3 Comparison with other interpretations

Textbook “Copenhagen”: To a good extent RQM is a completion of the standard textbook interpretation. The difference is that the latter assumes the existence of a classical world, or a classical observer, and describes the way quantum systems affect it in an interaction. The relational interpretation, on the contrary, assumes that an account of these interactions is valid with respect to any physical system. Thus, RQM is a sort of “democratised” version of Copenhagen, where some (but not all) roles of the single observer can be assumed by any physical system. These are sufficient to define a consistent interpretation, without need of the decohetence and the dissipation required by conventional quantum measurements. From the perspective of RQM, the textbook interpretation emerges when there is sufficent decoherence.

Many Worlds: Both RQM and the Many Worlds interpretation (see Vaidman 2018) are rooted in the work of Everett (1957). Both attempt to solve the mystery of quantum theory by adding a level of indexicality. In RQM, variables have values with respect to other physical systems. In Many Worlds, variables have values with respect to branches of the universal wave function. In neither interpretations there is any a priori special role for measurement, or observers. The main difference is the distinct ontological commitment: the Many Worlds interpretation is based on the assumption that all relative states are branches of a unique universal wave function, interpreted as a real entity, which obeys a single deterministic evolution law. The Many Worlds interpretation must work to recover Heisenberg uncertainty (via branch indexicality), probabilities (via subjective interpretation of probability), and discreteness, from this unique, deterministic, continuous universal wave function. RQM has all this easily in its foundation. On the other hand, the Many Worlds interpretation is based on a (according to some, inflated, but) no-nonsense realist metaphysics, which is precluded by the perspectivism of RQM. The two can perhaps made closer by the simple observation that modality can always be transformed into multiple world realism à la Lewis (1986), trading actuality for indexicality.

Hidden variables (Bohm): Hidden variable theories, of which Bohm theory (Bohm 1952) is the best available example, provide a realistic and deterministic interpretation of quantum mechanics. The similarity between RQM and Bohm theory is in the realistic interpretation of some variables, such as the position of a particle. The differences are two. The first is that on the Bohm theory it is position that always has a definite value, whereas, on RQM, what variable acquires a value in an interaction depends on the nature of the interaction. The second is that on the Bohm theory position always has a definite value, which changes in a continuous manner, whereas, on RQM, the ontology has the sparseness already discussed. In RQM there is no analog of the extra equation assumed in Bohm theory. Drezet (2024) has discussed the relation between Bohm theory and RQM.

Physical collapse: Physical collapse theories like Ghirardi, Rimini, and Weber (1986) and Penrose (1996) are physically distinguishable from standard QM, which is instead assumed to be correct up to contrary empirical indications, in RQM.

There are interpretations of quantum mechanics that are close to the relational one:

Zeilinger-Bruckner: The Relational Interpretation is close to the view of quantum theory held developed by Zeilinger and Bruckner; in particular, similar postulates to the original ones of RQM were independently proposed in (Zeilinger 1999, Brukner & Zeilinger 2003). These ideas generated some of the interesting mathematical work aiming at making the derivation of the formalism of quantum theory from information theoretical postulates precise. For versions of this program related to RQM see (Grinbaum 2005; Höhn 2017; Höhn & Wever 2017).

QBism: The emphasis on information in Rovelli (1996) influenced the birth of QBism (see Fuchs 1998: 3, 2001, 2002 [Other Internet Resources]). There are similarities between RQM and QBism (Pienaar 2021b). One similarity is the emphasis on dropping questions considered meaningless. The second is the use of the language of information theory (Spekkens 2014). The difference is mostly in the way the subject holding information is treated. In QBism the ideas of agent and experience are fundamental (DeBrota 2018 [Other Internet Resources]), while these ideas play no role in RQM. In RQM, the subject is fully naturalised: it is itself considered a physical system that can be described by quantum theory. This leads to a stronger version of realism that QBism, and to the emphasis on the relational aspect of all variables. In QBism the emphasis is in the information about the world held by a single subject, taken as primary. In RQM, the information is relative information (in the sense of Shannon) that a physical system has about another system; it is not primary (see Dorato 2017): it is can be simply understood physically as a correlation between the two systems that can be observed by a third system. Steven French (2024, 2024b) has framed the relation between QBism and RQM in terms of the two versions of perspetivalism (‘perspectival1’ and ‘perspectival2’) considered by Michela Massimi’s Perspectival realism (Massimi 2022).

Richard Healey: Healey’s pragmatist approach (Healey 1989) has in common with RQM the idea that the quantum state is not a description of physical reality, not even incompletely. Its main function is to be a (dispensable) tool for computing probabilities. The main difference is the emphasis on what quantum states are relative to. For Healey’s pragmatist view, a quantum state ascription is relative only to the perspective of an actual or potential agent (Healey 2012). In RQM, values are relative to any physical system. Restricting quantum theory to its use by agents is not a concern for Healey’s pragmatist philosophy; it is more so in a naturalistic perspective searching for an understanding of Nature that remains significative also where no agents are around. This is the same difference as between RQM and QBism, but Healey’s position is closer to RQM than QBism because while the QBism’s quantum state ascriptions depend on the epistemic state of the agent, for Healey the quantum state ascribed to a system depends only on the physical circumstances defining the perspective of the agent.

Phenomenology: Steven French discusses RQM from a phenomenological perspective (2024b, 9.8) and observes that there is the possibility of “an interesting accommodation [or RQM] with phenomenology” (2024b, pg 226) if RQM drops the insistence that an observer cannot assign a quantum state to themselves and the RQM can accomodate conscious observers.

Cavalcanti’s ‘Experimental metaphysics’: Cavalcanti’s formalization of the arguments connecting quantum predictions with general assumptions about the world (Cavalcanti 2008 [Other Internet Resources]) lead to a view very close to RQM.

2.4 Representation

The issue of the interpretation of quantum mechanics is related to the issue of the possibility of offering a representation in the sense of an intuitive account of what happens in the world. It can be useful to give a simple-minded pictorial representation of the intuition sustaining different interpretations. Imagine at time \(t_1\) a radioactive atom is surrounded by Geiger counters and at time \(t_2\) one of the counters clicks, having detected a product of the decay. What has happened during the \(t_1\)-\(t_2\) interval?

  • According to textbook quantum theory, the wave function of a particle classically trapped in the nucleus leaks out of the nucleus symmetrically, filling the space surrounding the nucleus. At the moment of the detection this wave function magically disappears everywhere except at the particular detector that clicks.
  • According to the Many Worlds interpretation, all detectors click. In fact, each detector clicks at every moment of time, but the wave function of the universe branches continuously into innumerable branches: we, ourselves, happen to be in one particular branch in which one particular detector clicks at one particular time.
  • According to the Bohmiam interpretation, the wave function equally leaks uniformly in space, but in the meanwhile the associated particle, guided by this wave function, zigzags around, until hitting a particular detector.
  • According to Physical Collapse interpretations, the wave function also leaks out uniformly, but when its effect on the heavy Geiger detectors begins to displace too much matter, the wave function collapses as in the textbook interpretation, but driven by a hypothetical dynamical process which has not yet been explicitly observed (Ghirardi 2018).
  • What about RQM? In the spirit of Heisenberg, there is no actual wave function out there in nature, nor there is any fact of the matter about the position of the particle respect to the Geiger counter at any moment between \(t_1\)and \(t_2\). The lack of determination of variables in quantun theory, in particular in RQM, has been discussed in (Calosi and Mariani 2020). However, there may be other facts of the matter. For instance, the position of the particle respect to some air molecule along the way. These, on the other hand, have no bearing on the position of the particle with respect to the Geiger counter, which actualises at time \(t_2\). The probabilistic distribution of this position does not depend on the position of the particle with respect to the air molecules.

2.5 Frauchiger-Renner experiment and locality

The Frauchiger-Renner thought-experiment (Frauchiger & Renner 2018) can be read as an indirect support to RQM, since it makes concrete the idea that “different observers can give different accounts of the same set of events”, as in the original RQM slogan. The experiment is discussed in the conceptual framework of RQM by Waaijer and van Neerven (2019 [Other Internet Resources]). But if course it can be accounted by all interpretations.

The application of RQM to the EPR context and the problem of quantum non locality has been initially discussed in Smerlak and Rovelli (2007) and (Laudisa 2001). Some of the claims of the earlier discussion about RQM being “local” have been questioned, pointing out that RQM should in any case be “forced to accept some form of non-locality in quantum phenomena” (Laudisa 2019: 227). See also Pienaar’s criticisms (2019) and the discussion in Martin-Dussaud, Rovelli, and Zalamea (2019) and (Martin-Dussaud 2021), where a specific sense in which quantum theory is non-local from the RQM perspective is clarified.

2.6 Solipsism?

Prima facie, RQM may seem to imply a form of perspectival solipsism (Rovelli 2024 [Other Internet Resources]), as the values of variables realized in the perspective of some system \(S\) are not necessarily the same as those realized with respect to another system \(S'\). However, often this is not the case, as follows directly from quantum theory itself. The key is to observe that any physical comparison is itself a quantum interaction. Suppose the variable \(A\) of \(S\) is measured by \(S'\) and stored into the variable \(A'\) of \(S'\). This means that the interaction has created a correlation between \(A\) and \(A'\). In turn, this means that a third system measuring \(A\) and \(A'\) will find consistent values. That is: the perspectives of \(S'\) and \(S''\) agree on this regard, and this can be checked in a physical interaction.

For instance: imagine experimenter \(S'\) measures the spin of the electron \(S\), and writes the value of this spin on a piece of paper. In principle, experimenter \(S''\) can devise an experiment where she can detect an effect due to interference between the two branches where the spin of the electron (and the text) have one or the other value. But if \(S''\) measures the spin and reads the piece of paper, she will find that experimenter \(S'\) has seen the same spin as herself.

Why? Because quantum theory predicts so, as can be seen from the following: with respect to \(S''\), the first interaction yields a quantum state of the form

\[ \begin{align} & \ket{\text{spin up}} \times \ket{\text{paper with text } \lsq\text{spin up}\rsq} \\ & + \ket{\text{spin down}} \times \ket{\text{paper with text } \lsq\text{spin down}\rsq} \end{align} \]

Measuring the spin projects the state on one single branch of the two, and both branches lead to consistency. Therefore, as long as we do not chase subtle interference phenomena hidden behind decoherence, RQM implies that we all ‘see the same world’.

3. General Comments

3.1 Reactions, criticisms, developments

Bas van Fraassen (2009) explores “the world of quantum mechanics as RQM depicts it” (2010: 390), clarifying what is and what is not relative to observers. He concentrates on the apparently paradoxical aspects of RQM. The limits on information that observers can have, which can only be acquired through physical interaction, have surprising consequences for complex situations in which an observer makes a measurement, a second observer makes measurements on the first and its target, and even a third observer comes in and observes a process involving the first two observers. Van Fraassen concludes that all the consistency questions can be laid to rest, when the situation’s representation in RQM is properly understood. On the other hand, he also observes that if in RQM what the state of a system relative to an observer is, is not itself relative to anything, then the question can be raised what relationships there are between the state of a specific entangled system or its components relative to different observers. He proposes and additional postulate, weakly relating the description of the same system as given by different observers, which forbids the possibility of disturbing inconsistencies allowed by the multiplication of perspectives. The idea of adding a postulate relating the description of the same system as given by different observers has later been developed in Adlam & Rovelli (2023).

Laura Candiotto (2017) argues that the best philosophical framework for RQM is Ontic Structural Realism (OSR) (Ladyman& Ross 2007; French & Ladyman 2011). Ontic structural realism is meant to be a defensible form of scientific realism (Ladyman 2019); it argues for the priority of relations over substances, as self-subsistent individual objects (Morganti 2011). For Candiotto, RQM is a realistic theory that assumes the notion of relation (the physical interaction between systems and instruments) as primitive; objects emerge as relational “nodes” (French 2006), or intersections of processes. The lack of observer-independence is not inability of providing an account of the structure of matter, because there are no intrinsic properties that can be assigned to systems independently of their interactions, therefore this structure is itself relational, hence in particular observer dependent. Relations via dynamical processes of information exchange can be taken as the building blocks of the universe.

The relation between RQM and ontic structural realism has been emphasized also by Mauro Dorato (2016). Dorato gives an extensive evaluation of RQM, pointing out its main characteristics. He emphasises then two aspects that characterise RQM. The first is a revisionary metaphysical account of quantum theory; that is: central assumptions of common sense must go, if they contradict contemporary physical theories. Here, what is abandoned is the presupposition that quantum systems have a non-relational, intrinsic nature. RQM’s metaphysics is revisionary also for a second reason. Analogously to the many-worlds interpretation, RQM does not suggest changing the formalism of quantum theory—as alternative formulations of the theory do—but rather, modifies the conceptual schemes with which we can interpret the formalism, and consequently, our metaphysics. Dorato observes that the relativisation of values implies a relativisation of the very notion of object or entity, if (i) having some intrinsic, non-purely dispositional properties is essential to the identity of an object, and (ii) no entity can exist if it does not have an intrinsic identity (see Nāgārjuna 1995). The only reality in RQM is given by events, which are the result of interactions between distinct quantum systems, but even these events can be described in a different way by different physical systems. The interaction cannot be described in a more precise way by a constructive theory in Einstein’s sense (Einstein 1919) that can explain the coming into being of a definite outcome without just assuming it as a fundamental fact. Dorato concludes that there is no measurement problem in RQM because RQM is implicitly formulated as a theory of principle. He also considers the issue of priority monism as defined in Schaffer (2010): Shaffer claims that quantum mechanics’ entanglement is evidence that the whole universe has ontological priority with respect to its parts. Dorato point out that the firm advocacy of relationalism of RQM has instead radical anti-holistic consequences.

The second characteristic aspect of RQM pointed out by Dorato is that, consequently, the best way to capture the nature of not-yet interacting quantum systems is to call into play a form of dispositionalism: the only way to attribute some sort of intrinsicness to the state-dependent properties of quantum systems is to attribute them dispositions to manifest in a certain way according to the interactions they are subject to. Dispositionalism is present in many other views of quantum mechanics (Dorato 2006) but fits particularly well in the context of RQM. Unlike Qbists interpretations of quantum theory, which are agents-centered, in RQM the relation “\(S\) manifest \(q\) relative to \(S'\)” is symmetric, and this is a simple consequence of the hypothesis that in RQM quantum systems and “observers” are on the same level. As a consequence of its relational and dispositional aspect, Dorato stresses the fact that in RQM there cannot be a universal flow of becoming, but only a local, worldline-dependent and relational one. This still counts as a relational form of becoming: no universal tide of coming into being, but a crisscross of ripples. Since a physical system can exemplify a given succession of events only relatively to another system and not absolutely, in RQM there cannot be cosmic time, so that also in general relativity temporal succession of events cannot be regarded as a total order. In a sense, in RQM there is no quantum state of the universe, or a God’s eye point of view, since the cosmos can only be described “from within a given perspective”.

Richard Healey has discussed RQM in two papers. In the first (2021), he questions possibility of reconciling the observer-relativity of measurement outcomes with a basic norm of scientific objectivity, in the context of a quantum theory of gravity. In the second (2022), he shifts to a more favorable view of main RQM thesis that the outcome of a quantum measurement is to be viewed as a relative, not an absolute, fact and he compares RQM to his pragmatist view of quantum theory. He argues that the version of RQM in Adlam & Rovelli 2023 solves his previous main objection to RQM (that its ontology of relative facts is incompatible with scientific objectivity and undercuts the evidential base of quantum theory) and brings RQM and his pragmatist view into even closer alignment.

Steven French (2024) discusses the relation between RQM and the “continental philosophy” account of quantum measurment given by Fritz London and Edmund Bauer in 1939. Andrea Oldofredi (2021) has argued that RQM is easily compatible with scientific realism, in the context of an ontology of properties (Oldofredi 2021). He has also discussed how precisely RQM solves the measurment problem in (Oldofredi 2022). Juan Sebastian Ardenghi and Olimpia Lombardi (2022) have discussed the relation between RQM and the Modal‑Hamiltonian Interpretation, arguing that the two interpretation complement each other. In (Martin-Dussaud, 2023) a mathematical formalisation of the notion of relative facts is proposed.

3.2 Relationality and realism

The central move of RQM is to interpret all physical variables as relational, namely as referring to two systems, not a single one, and to view them as realised only in interactions. Relationality has been playing an ever dominant role as our knowledge of the natural world has increased. Examples are the relational nature of velocity in classical mechanics, of locality in general relativity, of the potential in electromagnetism, of the gauge invariant observables in non-abelian gauge theories, and many others. RQM is a long step further in this direction. Taken seriously, the philosophical implications of this overreaching relationally can be heavy. The main one is a weakening of a strong version of realism.

There is nothing in RQM that contradicts the assumption that the world is “out there”, irrespectively of our mental states, or perceptions. In this weak sense RQM is consistent with realism. But RQM questions the assumption that each variables of each subsystem of the world has a single value at each and every time. In this stronger sense, realism is questioned by RQM. The ontology of RQM is a sparse ontology of relational quantum events, not derived from any unique “underlying” representation. This weakening of realism is in a direction similar to what happened with Galilean or Einstein’s relativity, which have shown that there is no fact of the matter in the velocity of a single object, or in the simultaneity of two space like separated events alone.

However, this is a radical step in this direction. In Laudisa (2019) it is pointed out that RQM gives no deeper account, or underlying dynamical representation, of the main process: the actualisation of quantum events at interactions. This is the process which in textbook quantum theory is called measurement and is accompanied by state reduction. Quantum mechanics gives probabilities for quantum events to happen, not a story representing how they happen. This core aspect of quantum theory is not resolved in RQM: it is taken as a fact of the world. What RQM does resolve is the question of when this happens: any time one system affects another one, it happens relative to this other system. What RQM does, is to show that this is not in contradiction with the existence of interference effects. But the core discreteness of the quantum event actualisation is not “explained” in RQM: it is understood as the picture of how nature works according to quantum theory. This can be understood to be in spirit of Newton’s famous observation “whatever is not deduced from the phenomena must be called a hypothesis; and hypotheses, whether metaphysical or physical, or based on occult qualities, or mechanical, have no place in experimental philosophy. In this philosophy particular propositions are inferred from the phenomena, and afterwards rendered general by induction” (Newton 1713).

The radicality of the step implied by RQM has been emphasized by Timotheus Riedel (2024). Riedel emphasizes the fact that RQM is necessarilly committed to an “unrestricted iteration principle”, according to which facts about what the facts are from some particular perspective are themselves perspective-dependent, and so on ad inf. This principle plays a crucial role in ensuring the communicability and coherence of events across perspectives, but is incompatible with the orthodox reading of relativity in terms of relationality, and instead requires adoption of a notion of perspectival facts. This follows from the fact that in RQM to say that a system \(S'\) has information about a system \(S\) is is itself a contingent property of the coupled system (\(S, S'\)), and as such it can only be relative to some system (possibly \(S'\) itself). Concretely, this situation can be physically realized when a measurment happens only if a certain quantum out come is realized, namely in the case of a superposition between a situation in which a measurmenet has happened and one in which it hasn’t. Hence RQM assumes that there is no absolute meaning to a propsotion like Fact E has obtained. The viability of this radical persectivism (including its RQM version) has been recently discussed by Peter Evans (2020) in a paper with the title Perspectival objectivity Or: how I learned to stop worrying and love observer-dependent reality.

This weakening of realism is the “price to pay” for the relational interpretation of quantum mechanics. It can be compared with the “price to pay” in other interpretations, such as the inflated ontology and the distance between the ontology and the world as we see it of the Many Worlds interpretation, the existence of variables unobservables in principle and the loss of Lorentz invariance of Bohm theory, and so on.

An alternative to this radical perspectivalism is to reduce it to relativism (Riedel 2024), namely to assume that values of variables are relative, but the fact that a variable has relative to a system is an absolute fact, which by itself is not relative to anything. Namely to assume that the actualization of each unique quantum event is a fundamental absolute physical event. This tamed version of RQM is often implicitly assumed by commentators, and criticised. Jacques Pienaar (2021) has given a sharp version of these criticisms in the form of five no-go theorems indicating that the balancing act between relative values and absolute actualization of quantum event cannot be sustanied. Related criticisms where raised in (Muciño 2022) and (Lawrence 2023). Responses, pointing to the fact that these papers contain implicit assumptions rejected in RQM, were given in (Rovelli 2021b [Other Internet Resources], Di Biagio & Rovelli 2022 and Cavalcanti 2023).

The other side of the coin of each “price to pay” is the lesson we might gather from the empirical success of quantum theory: for the Many Worlds interpretation, for instance, the lesson is the real existence of other branches, for Bohm theory is the real existence of unobservable variables that pick a preferred reference frame, and so on. For RQM, the lesson of quantum theory is that the description of the way distinct physical systems affect each other when they interact (and not the way physical systems ‘are’) exhausts all that can be said about the physical world. The physical world must be described as a net of interacting components, where there is no meaning to ‘the state of an isolated system’, or the value of the variables of an isolated system. The state of a physical system is the net of the relations it entertains with the surrounding systems. The physical structure of the world is identified as this net of relationships. The notion of substance that plays a major role in western philosophy might be inappropriate to account for this science; perhaps the idea of a “mutual dependency” (Nāgārjuna 1995) may offer a relevant philosophical cadre (Rovelli 2021).

3.3 The debate on the cross perspective link

Emily Adlam (2022) has argued that interpretations of quantum mechanics that deny observer-independence challenge our presumption of intersubjectivity regarding measurement outcomes and this can undemine the possibility of the scentific project itself, which is based on the possibility of such agreement. She argues that such observers are unable to escape their own perspective in order to learn anything about the perspectives of other observers and therefore be unable to confirm the theory. The challenge has motivated her and Rovelli to add to RQM a specific postulate about the relation between perspevctves (Adlam & Rovelli 2023). They consider a ‘Cross-Perspective Link’ postulate, which states that the measurement of a system’s pointer accurately reveals the outcome said system has registered in an earlier interaction (unless the pointer has been tampered with). This axiom stipulates the possibility of communication across viewpoints.

There are two ways to interpret this postulate. It can be interpreted strongly, as an absolute statment about a relation between perspectives. Alternatively, it can be interpreted weakly, as a statement about what can be ascertained by a (possibly further) observer. In thsi case, the postulate leads only to the consistency of physical communication implied by the quantum formalism discussed in 2.6 above.

The strong interpretation assumes that it is possible to take the ensemble of all perspectives realistically by “regard[ing] the pointlike quantum events or ‘flashes’ as absolute, observer-independent facts about reality” [Adlam & Rovelli 2023, Adlam 2024], even if this ensemble is not acessible in principle to anybody. Whether this option is a viable in RQM is an open question. It is challenged for instance by Riedel (2024) “unrestricted iteration principle”, and by specific no-go theorems (Pienaar 2021). Blake Stacey (2022 [Other Internet Resources]) has argued that the strong interpretation is step backs away from the perspectivalism that characterizes the interpretation: it is “a disguised form of the projection postulate leading to a ‘global collapse’ of the state of the interacting pair” (Lahti and Pelonpää 2023).

Interpreted weakly, the postulate is sufficient to guarantee the intersubjectivity between agents that enjoy a common decoherece domain. They can pile up a sufficient number of facts that are stable in the sense of (DiBiagio and Rovelli 2021) and develop rational science by noticing probabilistic regularities and by induection, and therefore develop and test physical laws. A community of scientific perception in agreement as to what constitutes the object of the investigation is therefore compatible with RQM ven in its full perspectival version. On the other hand, this is not sufficient to close off the possibility that with respect to a further observer external to this community the entire contingent world specifically described by current science could be just a term in a quantum superposition. So interpreted, RQM does not challenge the rationality of the scientific enterpreise, but does undermine the possibility of ascertaining facts as absolutely true. Taken in this sense, RQM interprets quantum phenomena as an invitation to a radical perspectivalism: with respect to some observer, we can always be like Friend is for Wigner. For a recent extensive discussion of these alteratives, see the Foundation of Physics Special Issue on RQM and especially the introduction by Calosi and Riedel (2024).

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