Moritz Schlick

First published Tue May 28, 2013; substantive revision Fri Mar 27, 2026

Although Moritz Schlick (1882–1936) left a significant mark in the history of philosophy as the founder and nominal leader of the Vienna Circle of Logical Positivists or Logical Empiricists, his lasting legacy includes a broad range of philosophical achievements. Indeed, Schlick’s reputation was established well before the Circle was founded by him in 1924 and went public in 1929. In 1917 he published Raum und Zeit in der gegenwärtigen Physik, a philosophical introduction to the new physics of Relativity Theory, which was highly acclaimed by Einstein himself as well as many others. In the following year the first edition of his influential Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre (General Theory of Knowledge) appeared, and in 1922 he was appointed to the prestigious chair of Naturphilosophie at the University of Vienna as successor of Ernst Mach and Ludwig Boltzmann. Upon his arrival at his new post, he immediately began to collaborate with the mathematician Hans Hahn and the sociologist and economist Otto Neurath. At the instigation of his students Herbert Feigl and Friedrich Waismann he formed a discussion group known as the ‘Schlick Zirkel’, later on as the Vienna Circle. In the 1920s the intellectual energy of the Circle was increased by newcomers like Rudolf Carnap, Karl Menger and Kurt Gödel, and from the 1930s also by the outside visitors from America (Ernest Nagel, W. V. O. Quine), Britain (A. J. Ayer), Poland (Alfred Tarski), and Germany (Hans Reichenbach). In 1927 Schlick first met Ludwig Wittgenstein, whose Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus (1921) played a crucial role in the discussions of the Vienna Circle and with whom Schlick, mostly together with Waismann, continued philosophical conversations till the end of his life. In 1930 Schlick published his book Fragen der Ethik (Problems of Ethics), which documented his growing interest in moral and cultural philosophy. This development put Schlick at the centre of a virtual whirlwind of philosophical activity which deepened, broadened, and matured his thinking. As his international fame grew, Schlick found himself lecturing in London, teaching at Stanford and Berkeley, and receiving offers to join the faculties of prestigious universities both at home and abroad. At the same time, in collaboration with Philipp Frank, he edited a number of monographs and books in the series Schriften zur wissenschaftlichen Weltauffassung, which exerted a deep and lasting influence on contemporary thought. Alas, Schlick’s life was cut short by an assassin’s bullets in 1936, much to the loss of the intellectual world.

1. Background

Moritz Schlick is primarily remembered as the leader of the Vienna Circle of Logical Positivists or Logical Empiricists, which flourished in the 1920s and 1930s. Few philosophers of science today would deny that their views have been influenced – one way or another – by the positions which emerged from the group of philosophers, mathematicians, and social scientists who gathered in interwar Vienna. And while it cannot be denied that other Circle members have been more prominent and influential in the long term, none contributed more unity and cohesion to the Vienna group during its brief existence than Schlick. Indeed, long before 1929, when the Circle’s Manifesto, Wissenschaftliche Weltauffassung: Der Wiener Kreis, appeared (Stadler and Uebel 2012), Schlick had already made contributions to scientific epistemology which exerted a profound influence on subsequent generations of philosophers. Other Circle members quite deservedly continue to receive a great deal of attention, and there has always been also a steady interest in Schlick’s views on a range of issues, for there is much of lasting value to be discovered in them (Schlick 1979a, 1979b; and see the volumes of Moritz Schlick Gesamtausgabe (MSGA) from 2006 onwards).

Schlick was born in Berlin in 1882 as the third and youngest son of a middle-class Protestant factory manager. After gymnasium, he studied natural sciences and mathematics in Heidelberg, Lausanne, and Berlin. His ambition led him to work with Max Planck in physics and he received his Ph.D. in 1904 on ‘The Reflection of Light in an Inhomogeneous Layer’ (Über die Reflexion des Lichtes in einer inhomogenen Schicht & Raum und Zeit in den gegenwärtigen Physik, Schlick 1904 [2006]). After a year of experimental work at Göttingen, he married an American woman, Blanche Hardy, published his first book Lebensweisheit (‘Wisdom of Life’, 1908) and eventually made his way to Zurich where he took up the study of Philosophy and Psychology. In 1910 he completed his Habilitation on The Nature of Truth in Modern Logic at the University of Rostock, where he secured a position as Privatdozent (private lecturer). During his ten years in Rostock he worked on reforming traditional philosophy against the backdrop of the revolution in natural science. He became friends with Albert Einstein, whose theory of relativity he was one of the first to explain philosophically (Schlick 1915, Schlick 1917a, Schlick 1917b [1963]). After having received the title of a professor in Rostock (1917) and serving during World War I at a military airport, he was appointed extra-ordinary and then full professor for ethics and natural philosophy at the University of Kiel in 1921. The publication of his main book Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre in 1918/1925 (translated as General Theory of Knowledge, Schlick 1918/1925 [1974]) paved the way for his subsequent academic career in philosophy.

In 1922 he was appointed the Chair of Naturphilosophie at the University of Vienna. Through all these changes, as well as subsequent modifications of his thought, the evidence of Schlick’s training in Berlin remained just below the surface. He was, after all, the heir apparent to the tradition of philosophical physicists. This tradition was founded by Hermann von Helmholtz, the icon of 19th-century physics and an influential leader of the zurück zu Kant (‘back to Kant’) movement, and continued by his student and (later) colleague Max Planck (Coffa 1991, 179–183). In Vienna, Schlick placed himself in the tradition of the philosopher-physicist Ernst Mach, beginning with his inaugural lecture, followed by his chairing the Verein Ernst Mach (Ernst Mach Society) (Stadler 2019, Stadler 2022). Although few professional philosophers embraced the methods and problems of philosophical physicists like Schlick and his Berlin colleague Hans Reichenbach, they were highly influential throughout the community of professional physicists, largely due to their prestige.

2. The Philosophical Physicists: Helmholtz, Mach and Planck

Although Schlick was originally trained in physics, it is important to remember that, in late 19th-century Germany and Austria, physicists were deeply interested in philosophical issues, especially at Berlin and Vienna. Schlick was the intellectual heir of both Helmholtz and Planck. In 1889, Planck replaced Gustav Kirchhoff at the Friedrich-Wilhelms-Universität zu Berlin and became Helmholtz’s colleague. Both Helmholtz and Planck integrated Kantian themes in their philosophical thinking and there can be no doubt that, even though Schlick could never be considered much of a Kantian, he was deeply familiar and partly sympathetic with many of Kant’s ideas. To begin with, Kant’s interests in epistemological concerns arising from the advanced mathematical sciences attracted Schlick’s admiration and respect, much as it had drawn the interest of Helmholtz and Planck. And all three embraced the goal of developing a philosophical understanding of recent developments in physical science according to the spirit, if not the letter, of Kant’s thought. For the most part, their departures from Kant’s original doctrines may be viewed as innovations or improvements of Kant’s insights, introduced without abandoning their own most fundamental philosophical commitments (Stadler 2018).

For instance, one of Helmholtz’s best-known innovations is the study of perception in his monumental Handbuch der physiologischen Optik of 1856–1867 (translated as Treatise on Physiological Optics, Helmholtz 1867 [1924–1925]). This work was the source of his so-called ‘sign theory’, based on the idea that perceptions are signs or placeholders for what they signify, but do not resemble or copy them in any way. In his early writings, Helmholtz takes sensations to be signs of their external causes, so the associations among sensations represent corresponding regularities among their sources. Consequently, it is the regular changes of signs, their serial structure, which reflect the order of their underlying causes. But this latter consequence implies a causal theory of perception which is fundamentally antithetical to Kant’s understanding of causality. After all, Kant had restricted the operations of causality to the realm of appearances, thus excluding unobservable causes lying behind and causing observable phenomena. This departure from a basic tenet of Kant’s thought was compounded by the fact that Helmholtz’s account of the knowledge of the location of objects in space is thoroughly empiricist, and also rests on the principle of causality, understood as a causal realist would. But in the 1881 notes to his memoir, Helmholtz corrected himself, recalling that Kant’s views on causality were limited to lawfulness among appearances (Friedman 2010, 631; Friedman 1997, 30–31). What Helmholtz then asserted, in his classic essay “On the Facts of Perception”, is that the inference to a hypostasized reality lying behind the appearances goes beyond what is warranted by the lawfulness obtaining among appearances. Indeed, all localizations of objects in space are really nothing more than the discovery of the lawfulness of the connections obtaining among our motions and our perceptions. The difference between what is genuinely perceived and its realistic interpretation is just the difference between the regularities in our perceptions and the hypothesis of enduring, substantial sources of the perceived regularities (Helmholtz 1878 [1977, 138–140]). Given Schlick’s sign-oriented early epistemology (Schlick 1918/1925 [1974]: see Section 3) it is no coincidence that he later praised Helmholtz as a pioneer of a structural realism (Schlick 1921, 1922).

Although Helmholtz’s philosophical work was not particularly well received by professional philosophers like Hermann Cohen, co-founder of the Marburg School of neo-Kantians, it exerted a powerful influence on physicists (Cohen 1885, 202–204). In particular, Max Planck was an early supporter of the sign theory. But Planck never interpreted the sign theory causally, as Helmholtz had in his earliest writings. Rather, Planck claimed that “our perceptions provide, not a representation of the external world”, but rather “measurements furnish the physicist with a sign which he must interpret” (Planck 1960, 53; Planck 1933, 84). Furthermore, Planck generalized the sign theory, arguing that it is not objects, in and of themselves, which are known, but the structural relations in which they stand to one another. His fundamental idea was that what is known is not the natures of ‘things’ but complex structures of relations connecting ‘things’ to one another (Planck 1933, 84ff.; Planck 1960, 53). Thus, the ‘objects of knowledge’ are not objects at all; rather, what is known is the relata of the structural networks of relations in which they stand to other relata. And as recent developments had increased the level of abstraction of scientific thought, it had become further removed from its anthropomorphic origins. So the unification of the scientific world-picture is achieved through increasing abstraction which, in turn, drives structural representation, thus reducing the anthropomorphic elements in the scientific image of the world (Planck 1949, 105). The result of Planck’s work is a theory of knowledge which is structuralist, generalized from Helmholtz’ sign theory of perception, but which nonetheless preserves the themes of unification and objectivity derived from Kant (Heidelberger 2022).

These themes are particularly evident in Planck’s celebrated 1908 Leiden lecture on “The Unity of the Physical Universe”, directed against Ernst Mach’s phenomenalistic and empiricist philosophy of science (Planck 1960, 1–26). Mach replied passionately (Mach 1910) to this provoking lecture, complaining of basic misunderstandings, because he regarded physical objects as unnecessary hypostatizations, implying that the mechanical view underlying physics is little more than an elaborate myth. The physics of matter was effectively settled when Planck secured the mechanical foundations of irreversibility in his Radiation Law of 1900, relying on Ludwig Boltzmann’s statistical approach to thermodynamics which, in turn, implied atomism. But the philosophical implications of these achievements remained to be established. In his Leiden lecture, Planck argued that this result presented an objective world-picture abstracted from its anthropomorphic origins to produce a synthetically unified image of the world (Planck 1960, 6). Such a view, Planck argued, can only be produced through the unification of the diverse fields of physical phenomena if they are synthesized by means of mathematical abstraction. Such abstraction generalizes the sign theory to apply to theoretical as well as perceptual representations, resulting in a full-blown structuralist epistemology (Planck 1933, 84ff.; Planck 1949, 105). And it is this method of abstraction that produces the synthetic unity grounding scientific objectivity. The result is that physical entities are ‘objective’, in the Kantian sense, since they embody the lawfulness of appearances. Indeed, Planck insisted that what is ‘objective’ is precisely what the heroes of the history of science, from Copernicus to Faraday, would have regarded as ‘real’ (Planck 1960, 25–26). Despite the strident Kantian themes of Planck’s argument, his conclusion has always been regarded as a particularly severe form of convergent realism (Stöltzner 2010). The later Schlick, under the influence of Wittgenstein and the Vienna Circle, would distance himself gradually from his former teacher when he tried to overcome metaphysical pseudo-problems between “Positivism and Realism” (Schlick 1932 [1948]).

3. Early Epistemology

Emerging from the tradition of the philosophical physicists, Schlick’s early thought bears the marks of his intellectual legacy. After the completion of his graduate study in physics and his philosophical study of relativity theory (Schlick 1904 and 1917a [2006]), Schlick soon turned his attention to scientific philosophy as presented by Alois Riehl and Richard Avenarius, with many reviews and publications in the Vierteljahresschrift für wissenschaftliche Philosophie und Soziologie (Ferrari 2002), but he was also inspired by Schopenhauer and Nietzsche in his former practical philosophy (Schlick 2013). Within a few short years, he had written a youthfully enthusiastic ethical tract called Lebensweisheit (Schlick 1908 [2006]), a lucid study of concept analysis called “Die Grenze der naturwissenschaftlichen und philosophischen Begriffsbildung” (“The Boundaries of Scientific and Philosophical Concept-Formation”, 1910: Schlick 1979a, 25–40), and a substantial essay on “Das Wesen der Wahrheit nach der modernen Logik” (“The Nature of Truth in Modern Logic”) with a refutation of pragmatism (also 1910: Schlick 1979a, 41–103).

In “The Boundaries”, Schlick provided a broad sketch of his understanding of scientific thought, which identifies the aim of science as the reduction of phenomena to relationships governed by law, thus exhibiting individual events as special cases of universal, exceptionless regularities. Science is expressed mathematically, in spatio-temporal form, to provide for exact measurement. And the individual sciences are demarcated by distinctive intensive qualities, as ‘mass’ distinguishes mechanics, ‘heat’ thermodynamics, etc. Although the methods of mathematico-scientific concept-formation reduce the entire natural world to purely quantitative relations, it is powerless in the face of irreducible pure qualities. This is the task of philosophy, so that philosophy becomes the theory of qualia.

Schlick’s work on “The Nature of Truth in Modern Logic” not only provides a broad survey of treatments of truth then current in German philosophy, and a critique of Heinrich Rickert, but it also introduces an original view of truth as univocal designation. A judgment, as a structured complex of its constituents, is coordinated with the fact which consists of the entities signified by the judgment’s constituents, arranged in a way which is coordinated with the structure of the particular judgment. When the constituents are structured in a judgment so that the whole judgment univocally designates a situation in the world, then the judgment is true; otherwise, it is false. The conception of truth as univocal coordination figured prominently in Schlick’s theory of knowledge before his Vienna period, and was discussed later in the Vienna Circle in its relation to Wittgenstein’s Tractatus logico-philosophicus (1922).

The centerpiece of Schlick’s early epistemology is the idea of a chasm between intuitive acquaintance and conceptual knowledge, which anticipates his distinction between Erleben and Erkennen (Schlick 1926 [1979]). Although Schlick’s distinction is reminiscent of Kant’s contrast between intuitions and concepts, Schlick regarded intuition as fully naturalized, much as Helmholtz had. When the elements of judgments are initially identified, they are grasped qualitatively, as sensory impressions, like the visual image of a particular dog or the memory image of a horse. These intuitions of acquaintance have spatial qualitaties, since they are not only extended but situated with respect to one another in the space of the particular sensory modality through which they are perceived. They are also temporal, since they succeed one another in time. For an example, in “Was ist Erkenntnis?” (“What is Knowing?”, 1911/12), Schlick considered the visual image of something in the distance which, as it approaches, is identified first of all as an animal, then is recognized as a dog, and when it comes close enough will be recognized as ‘my dog Fritz’. Each of these cases involves the recognition of one thing – the image of that which is approaching – as something different: an animal, a dog, and (finally) Fritz. Thus, each of these cases involves knowledge that the image is that of an instance of some class (Schlick 1979a, 119–121; see also Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 2). And the same process, in which one thing is recognized as another and therefore known, occurs in cases of scientific knowledge. For instance, the early explanations of light recognized that its behavior was much the same as the behavior of waves. Thus, in the work of Christian Huygens, light came to be known as a wave phenomenon, or in other words as the wave-like propagation of a state. Later, through the work of Heinrich Hertz, it was realized that light was unlike mechanical waves which traveled through a medium (such as water or air); in fact light behaved more like electrical waves. Accordingly, light became known as an electromagnetic wave phenomenon. In this case, as in the everyday case of the knowledge that the approaching animal is my dog Fritz, light was originally known as a mechanical wave phenomenon and only later did it become known as electromagnetic waves (Schlick 1979a, 121–122; Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 3).

In the early stages of everyday knowledge, what is rediscovered or recognized when something is known is an intuitive idea. Intuitive ideas present images which are signs of their contents and are drawn from sensory experience. Of course, images are vague, blurred, and ill-defined, so that when one conjures up an image, say, of one’s father, the expression on his face may not be clear and distinct, so that it may be impossible to tell whether he is frowning or merely looking puzzled (Schlick 1979a, 126–127; Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 4). And while intuitive ideas are sufficient for the purposes of everyday life, scientific inquiry naturally demands more rigorous methods for capturing and expressing ideas. For this reason, concepts – ideas with precisely delineated contents – are used. While the meanings of terms used in everyday discourse are usually intuitive ideas, in science they are almost exclusively concepts. This provides scientific judgments with content which is accurately circumscribed, while at the same time eliminating their intuitive content. In his General Theory of Knowledge (Schlick 1918/1925 [1974]), Schlick explained that concepts are formed in clusters, just as the primitive concepts of a mathematical field are defined in terms of one another by the axioms of the discipline. In his earlier epistemological writings he explains concept-formation in a more traditional fashion, by reference to marks or characteristics (Merkmale) which belong to all the objects which fall under the concept. Concepts thus represent classes of objects, defined in terms of determinate traits, so that their scope is exactly demarcated. Thus, they differ from intuitions, which are indistinct representations of what is presented to a particular sensory modality. So, the intuition of a triangle in general or a man in general can only be a hazy, fuzzy-edged visual representation of some particular triangle or man. And while everyday knowing proceeds by comparisons of intuitions, scientific knowledge replaces intuitions in these comparisons with precisely delineated concepts. In short, it is through its reliance on concepts that scientific thinking takes knowledge to a higher level than everyday knowing or common-sense epistemology.

Thus, in his early philosophical writings Schlick introduced an innovative conception of truth as univocal designation and affirmed a contrast between intuitions and concepts which was ultimately derived from Kant and naturalized by Helmholtz. Soon, Schlick was presented with an opportunity to display his scientific acumen, by explaining the philosophical import of Special Relativity.

4. Special Relativity

Schlick availed himself of the opportunity to elaborate his epistemological views in application to the new physics of relativity in his 1915 essay on “Die philosophische Bedeutung des Relativitätsprinzips” (“The Philosophical Significance of the Principle of Relativity”: Schlick 1979a, 153–189). This essay is particularly significant in Schlick’s development since it first presented certain philosophical tenets which would figure in all his subsequent work. Implicit in the general philosophical scheme in which Schlick discussed relativity is an objective, logical distinction between the representational framework in which scientific claims may be formulated and those claims themselves. An intrinsic function of the representational scheme is the constitution of the very concepts in which the formulation of empirical claims is first made possible. Moreover, since the same empirical claims may be expressed in distinct representational schemes, the content which is expressed by all the differing conceptual frameworks comprises the common, objective content of scientific assertions. In contrast, what varies from one description to another reflects the features of the representational systems which distinguish them from one another.

Schlick applied these insights to the fact that no physical means suffice to distinguish inertial frames, or in other words no (uniform, rectilinear) motion can be detected relative to the ether. There are two alternative responses to this situation. The first alternative, due to Lorentz and Fitzgerald, accommodates experimental findings through the postulation of compensating contractions of moving bodies in the direction of motion. Buttressed by additional auxiliary hypotheses, the Lorentz-Fitzgerald hypothesis preserves the absolute space and time of Euclid and Newton, as well as Galilean kinematics, while explicating experimental failures to detect the absolute rest of the ether by positing a real effect of absolute motion on length. The alternative presented by Einstein in the Special Theory was simply to deny the presupposition of an absolute time reference, allowing that two spatially separated events may be temporally ordered in one way for a given system of reference, and may also be ordered differently for a distinct yet equally legitimate system. Contractions of length are then a consequence of the relativity of reference frames: the length of a measuring-rod depends on its velocity for a given frame of reference (Schlick 1979a, 160–161). Consequently, the facts of observation are accommodated as well by the Principle of Special Relativity as they are by the Lorentz-Fitzgerald hypotheses. In other words, they are equivalent: “both theories do the same thing” (Schlick 1979a, 162). The principal advantage of Einstein’s approach is that his solution is clearly the simplest (ibid.).

Thus both theories do the same thing, but Einstein’s is very much simpler since it employs only a single explanatory principle, whereas the other needs a series of special hypotheses. In such a situation there would never have been any doubt as to which theory was preferable and thus to be regarded as the ‘correct’ one; everyone would (consciously or otherwise) have acted on the rule that principia non sunt augmenda praeter necessitatem … and accepted Einstein´s theory without further ado.

At this juncture, it should be noted that Schlick did not argue that the choice between the available alternatives is conventional because they are empirically equivalent, implying all the same observational consequences. Rather, Schlick repeatedly urged that there is an underlying physical equivalence from which the empirical or observational equivalence follows. And the fact that it is the physical rather than observational equivalence which serves as premise of his argument is especially evident from his use of his earlier analysis of the concept of truth to explicate the equivalence.

By the way, this argument refers to the principle of economy of thought and theory choice which had been elaborated by Mach in his writings since 1872 and was appreciated by Einstein, too. The correspondence between Mach and Einstein as well as between Einstein and Schlick confirms these common interpretations of relativity and its theories (Hentschel 1990, 2023; Wolters 1987, 1988; Engler, Iven & Renn 2022). Later, in his General Theory of Knowledge, Schlick described the nature of knowledge accessible through an investigation of the fundamental questions of science by way of philosophical clarification and critically commented on Mach’s theory of “elements” (Schlick 1918/25, 54). With some reservations about Mach’s “principle of economy of thought”, Schlick claimed that knowledge seeks comprehensive interconnections – deductive and logical ones (Ibid., 98). He stated that science aims at the minimization of the logical principles and concepts necessary for scientific explanations (Stadler 2021, 198 ff.).

Understood in this manner, the principle of economy is of course not a correct expression of the essence of science. Yet it does contain a kernel of truth … Knowing consists in designating the things of the world completely and uniquely by means of a minimum number of concepts. To achieve this designation with the smallest possible number of concepts – this is the economy of science. (Schlick 1918/25, 99).

Schlick thought the situation in physics presented a thoroughgoing analogy with Poincaré’s treatment of the conventionality of geometry. He noted, first of all, that Poincaré’s geometric conventionalism was founded on the Kantian insight that it is only the behavior of bodies in space that forms the object of study, so that the resulting physics is “the product of two factors, namely the spatial properties of bodies and their physical properties in the narrower sense” (Schlick 1979a, 169; cf. also 230–233). The point of Schlick’s reference to Poincaré is to illustrate the particular variety of conventionalism operative in Poincaré’s treatment of geometry, in order to apply it to the case of Special Relativity. And just as Poincaré isolated two factors in the treatment of the motion of rigid bodies, in general any true theory may be regarded as the product of a reference system, or representational scheme, and the judgments formulated in that system. Since there are alternative ways of securing univocal coordination, the components with respect to which distinct but equivalent representations differ are artefacts of the representational scheme. Departing from Poincaré, Schlick recognized that the representational framework that appears simplest when regarded in isolation may nonetheless require excessively complicated formulations for the description of reality. And he insisted, contra Poincaré, that it is the simplicity of these formulations that is the most compelling desideratum, not the simplicity of the representational scheme. Thus, the representational scheme that allows for the simplest description of reality is always to be preferred – so much the worse for Euclid, and Poincaré too:

It is therefore not correct to say that experience could ever prove space to be ‘non-Euclidian in structure’, i.e., could ever compel us to adopt the second of these alternatives. On the other hand, Poincaré also errs when he somewhere expresses the opinion that the physicist would actually always choose the first assumption. For no one was able to predict whether it might not some time be necessary to depart from Eucledian measure determinations in order to be able to describe the physical behavior of bodies most simply (Schlick 1979a, 231).

5. General Relativity

In correspondence with Einstein Schlick explained that his monograph Raum und Zeit in der gegenwärtigen Physik was “less a representation of the general theory itself than a thorough-going elucidation of the thesis that space and time have now forfeited all objectivity in physics” (Engler, Iven & Renn 2022; see Schlick 1917a and Schlick 1917b [1963]; the latter includes Schlick’s subsequent publications on Einstein’s General Theory of Relativity in three enlarged editions of 1919, 1920, and 1922). Schlick is referring to Einstein’s remark, in his 1916 paper on the General Theory, that the admission of arbitrary coordinative transformations “removes the last vestige of physical objectivity from space and time” (Einstein 1916 [2008], 117). In his monograph Schlick first described the differences between the space of the older physics and the space postulated by Einstein. In Newtonian physics (as well as the physics of the Special Theory), all measurement was founded on the notion of a rigid rod, and space was still regarded as Euclidean so long as measurements were made within the same coordinate system. Thus, in the older physics, space was conceived as complete with metrical properties, defined by rigid rods which possess the same length in any place at any time. It is particularly to be noted that the metrical properties of space were regarded as independent of the distribution of bodies in space and their gravitational fields. It is precisely these conditions that are changed in General Relativity: instead, the principle of general covariance implies that properties cannot be ascribed to space independently of any consideration of the things in it. Einstein showed that non-Euclidean methods of determining measurements must be used in the presence of a gravitational field, and this follows from the insight that it is the things in space which give space a particular structure. The result is a complete relativization of space (Schlick 1904 [2006], Sec. VII).

In classical mechanics it was determined by convention (see Section 4 above) that a rigid rod was the same length throughout space, and this convention was modified in Special Relativity. But in General Relativity the length of a rigid rod may also depend on its place and position, in such a way that consistency with Special Relativity is maintained. Thus, to maintain the general postulate of relativity, it is necessary to reduce the objective spatial structure of the earlier physics to a non-intuitive topology. This is a radical departure from the objectivity of the spatial structure of these earlier systems, which was entirely an artifact of their fixed metrical structure. In Relativity Theory the resulting conceptual construction admits of distinct metrical structures in different regions depending on the gravitational field in that region. As Schlick reflects in the closing pages of Raum und Zeit in der gegenwärtigen Physik (Schlick 1917b [1963]), the very possibility of the objectivity of this conceptual construction depends entirely on the method of point-coincidences. Any features of the world-picture which do not contribute to the systematization of point-coincidences are not physically objective. And all world-pictures which contain laws governing point-coincidences are thoroughly equivalent. Furthermore, since any functional, single-valued deformation of the world-picture leaves all point-coincidences undisturbed, the equations of physics retain their form under such transformations, implying that they are covariant under all substitutions. These substitutions also leave the form of physical equations unchanged for coordinate-systems in motion, allowing for the relativity of space within such coordinate-systems, thus depriving space and time of the “last vestige of physical objectivity” (Schlick 1904 [2006], Sec. VII).

Einstein was so impressed with Schlick’s presentation that, in a letter to Arnold Sommerfeld, he described it as “masterly”, perhaps because Schlick was one of the first commentators to see that space and time have no existence or reality prior to the metric field.

Raum und Zeit in der gegenwärtigen Physik was followed in 1918 by the first edition of Schlick’s Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre (later translated as General Theory of Knowledge: Schlick 1918/1925 [1974]). During the same period, Schlick spent a year engaged in war work at Aldershof airport outside Berlin, followed in 1921 by an appointment at Kiel. Since rumors were already spreading about a possible appointment at Vienna, Schlick’s family stayed in Rostock until 1922, when they moved to Vienna where he assumed the Chair of Naturphilosophie, following on from Ernst Mach’s professorship (1895–1901) and Ludwig Boltzmann’s lectures in philosophy of nature (1903–1906) (van de Velde-Schlick 2008; Ferrari 2009). Schlick’s selection for the post was probably initiated by the mathematician Hans Hahn and the physicist Phillip Frank, with a strong recommendation from Einstein. When Schlick arrived in Vienna, he immediately became involved with Hahn, Frank and also Otto Neurath in their Thursday night discussion meetings in the natural science and mathematics building of the University of Vienna, Boltzmanngasse 5. Schlick was a welcome addition to the group, and together they formed the core of what would later become known as ‘the Vienna Circle’ (Uebel 2003; Stadler 2001 [2015]). Philosophy would never be the same (Limbeck-Lilienau and Stadler 2015; Sigmund 2015 [2017]; Stadler 2001 [2015]).

However, before arriving in Vienna, Schlick engaged with the neo-Kantians Hans Reichenbach and Ernst Cassirer, who had published their own philosophical understandings of the new physics of relativity. In his Relativitätstheorie und Erkenntnis a priori (later translated as Relativity Theory and Apriori Knowledge: Reichenbach 1920 [1966]) Reichenbach had argued for a modified conception of Kant’s synthetic a priori, which challenged Schlick’s thought in a decisive way. At Einstein’s request, Schlick wrote to Reichenbach in the Fall of 1920, hoping to discuss the differences between them (Schlick 1920a; Schlick 1920b; Einstein 1920). In his own essays Schlick had challenged Kantian apriorism principally by identifying the presuppositions of the new physics as conventions, in Poincaré’s sense. Since the presuppositions of relativity were alien to classical physics, they were nothing like the self-evident, eternal verities that comprised the Kantian a priori. But while Schlick rejected Kant’s treatment of the a priori altogether, Reichenbach claimed to have preserved its most important element, its constitutive function (Reichenbach 1920 [1966], Ch. V; Friedman 1999, 59–70; Oberdan 2009). For Kant had attributed to the a priori the philosophically indispensible function of constituting the object of experience or knowledge. Indeed, such principles are the general laws for ordering experience to produce knowledge. Since all empirical knowledge presupposes these ordering principles, they can never conflict with experience and are, in this sense, necessarily true (Reichenbach 1920 [1966, 55–56]). Schlick first wrote to Reichenbach in the Fall of 1920, acknowledging that he regarded the assumption of constitutive principles as self-evident; indeed, he feared that the matter was so obvious that he might not have discussed it sufficiently in his General Theory of Knowledge (Schlick 1920a, 1; Oberdan 1994, 109–110). Nonetheless, it was precisely the principles which Reichenbach himself had identified as synthetic a priori that constituted an observation or measurement of an experience. Yet, Schlick confessed, he was unable to discover any characteristics of these alleged synthetic a priori principles that genuinely distinguish them from conventions. If the precepts Reichenbach called “synthetic a priori” were just what Schlick had identified as “conventions”, then the differences between them were, at most, terminological (Schlick 1920b, 2). But this apparently terminological difference, Schlick thought, masked a far deeper difference, since on Reichenbach’s understanding the a priori constitutes the objects of experience and knowledge, whereas on Schlick’s understanding conventions only constitute concepts, which may be applied to experiences and objects, but do not constitute them. Thus, Schlick insisted on distinguishing his own realist epistemology from Reichenbach’s modified Kantianism, because of the latter’s implicit anti-realism. It was not by accident that Schlick invited Carnap to come to Vienna instead of Reichenbach.

Schlick also contributed a critical essay on Ernst Cassirer’s Zur Einsteinschen Relativitätstheorie. Erkenntnistheoretische Betrachtungen (Einstein’s Theory of Relativity (Cassirer 1921 [1923]) to the prestigious journal Kant-Studien (“Kritizistische oder empiristische Deutung der neuen Physik” (“Critical or Empiricist Interpretation of Modern Physics?”, 1921: Schlick 1979a, 322–334)). Schlick explained that Cassirer’s position rested on a false dichotomy. On the one hand, Cassirer’s own Logical Idealism incorporated principles for the ordering and measuring of sensations to constitute physical objects. On the other hand, the only alternative Cassirer considered was a variety of phenomenalistic empiricism founded on “the sensualistic concept of experience”. In other words, Cassirer’s operative assumption was simply that the only possible philosophical frameworks for understanding contemporary science are either a strict empiricism or one incorporating constitutive principles. Schlick regarded his own philosophical framework as a clear counterexample, since it is an empiricist epistemology distinguished by its inclusion of constitutive principles. So, he judged that Cassirer committed the same error as Reichenbach by blithely ignoring the possibility of constitutive principles which are not synthetic a priori judgments. A combination of empiricism with constitutive principles would fall somewhere between the strict empiricism Cassirer refutes and the Logical Idealism Cassirer defends. At this point, Schlick first used what would eventually become a familiar complaint against Kant and the neo-Kantians, especially their characterization of the constitutive principles as synthetic judgments a priori. As Schlick understood constitutive principles, they are certainly not synthetic a priori principles, for they are conventions, which are neither a priori nor synthetic (Schlick 1979a, 322–334). The result of Schlick’s critique of Cassirer was, in Einstein’s words, “ingenious and true” (Einstein 1921, 59).

6. General Theory of Knowledge

Schlick’s earlier epistemological insights, together with the conventionalist framework developed in his work on the Special Theory of Relativity, set the stage for his thought in the two works which mark his pre-Vienna era. General Theory of Knowledge (Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre) was largely composed in 1916, with its first edition appearing in 1918, the second in 1925, and the English translation in 1974. Raum und Zeit in der gegenwärtigen Physik. Zur Einführung in das Verständnis der allgemeinen Relativitätstheorie appeared for the first time in 1917 as an extended essay in the prestigious journal Die Naturwissenschaften; soon it was re-issued in three more editions in 1917, 1919, and 1920; it was translated into English in 1920, as Space and Time in Contemporary Physics: An Introduction to the Theory of Relativity and Gravitation, and eventually into many other languages. Before explaining how Schlick’s epistemology embraced the new physics, it is necessary first of all to consider how he further developed his earlier epistemological insights (Schlick 1904 [2006]; Schlick 1918/1925 [1974]; Engler 2009; Engler, Iven, and Renn 2022).

General Theory of Knowledge is notable for a key innovation in its treatment of concepts: they are defined in terms of mathematical equations rather than reduced to complexes of intuitive images (Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 5). In order to articulate his ideas about the nature of concepts and how they are formed, Schlick borrowed the idea of definition by axioms from recent work in the foundations of geometry by Moritz Pasch, David Hilbert, and Henri Poincaré. In their work on alternative geometries, these mathematicians came to regard the effects of altering the axioms of geometry as changing the meaning of their constituent terms, thus redefining the primitive geometric concepts. The idea is ingenious in its simplicity, for it treats the geometric primitives as defined by the relations they bear to one another according to the axioms, so the meanings of the terms ‘point’, ‘lies between’, and ‘lies upon’ are fixed by the geometric axioms. The reason mathematicians adopted this method was to ensure the certainty of geometry by ensuring that it was invulnerable to the criticism that its primitive elements were defined by intuition. In the 5th section on concepts Schlick concludes that “Concepts are simply imaginary things (Gedankendinge), intended to make possible an exact designation of objects for the purpose of cognition. Concepts may be likened to the lines of latitude and longitude, which span the earth and permit us to designate unambiguously any position on its surface” (Schlick 1918/25/1974, 27).

He further claimed that Hilbert’s method of definition by axioms was implicit because, unlike explicit definition, occurrences of the defined term cannot necessarily be replaced by a combination of the expressions which define it. And he praised this method for its specification of meanings independently of any intuitive content. Implicitly defined terms possess a clarity and precision of scope which cannot be achieved by concepts defined by abstraction from experience. Since axiomatic definitions stipulate the meanings of all their constituent concepts in terms of the remaining ones, the axioms effectively define concepts by their relations to one another. Thus, implicit definitions are structural definitions, and their constituent terms are structurally defined (Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 7). The concepts thus defined are related only to the other elements of the axiom system and are not related to anything external to the axiom system until the definition is coordinated with extra-linguistic things. In Schlick’s earlier writings, he had stated that concepts themselves are functions which signify or designate the items with which they are coordinated or associated. Accordingly, even implicitly defined concepts must be coordinated with objects, elements of the class of things to which they apply (Schlick 1979a, 130; Schlick 1918/1925 [2009, 23]; Ryckman 1991, Sec. 3). Of course, these objects, like the concepts which designate them, are distinguished by possession of the properties in terms of which the designating concepts are defined. Such co-ordinations give empirical content to implicitly defined concepts, transforming them into full-blooded concepts rather than empty placeholders. Moreover, the concepts which dominate scientific thought at any given stage of its development must be modified, revised, and supplemented as science advances. So a conceptual characterization of a given phenomenon which was used at an earlier stage might not be used at a later stage, as, for instance, the judgment ‘A light-ray consists of a stream of moving particles’, drawn from Newtonian optics, was later replaced by ‘A light-ray consists of electromagnetic waves’.

Schlick’s new understanding of concept-formation allows him to address seriously the question of how the respective intuitive spaces of each of the senses are coordinated in the construction of a general intuitive space, which is not specific to any particular sense modality. The intuitive images of experience are spatially ordered, since they exhibit relative locations as well as spatial extension. In addition, since experiences occur one after another, they also exhibit an intuitive temporal order. This results in a distinct spatio-temporal ordering for each of the sense modalities, so that an intuitive order of smells, as well as an intuitive order of tastes (and so forth), is given in experience. The first step in the advance from purely subjective experiences to the transcendent ordering of scientific objects (according to his critical realism) is to coordinate the spatio-temporal frameworks of the distinct sense modalities. Thus, when a sore spot on one’s leg is touched by one’s forefinger, the feeling of the touch is accompanied by a visual image of the finger touching the leg. The coincidence of these two separate and distinct types of sensory data contributes evidence to the overall coordination of the spatio-temporal orders of the different sense modalities. This is the method of point-coincidences which Schlick used to characterize the advance from the purely subjective domain of qualitative images to knowledge of the transcendent world. Of course, the idea of point-coincidences also plays a central role in General Relativity, and it has generally been assumed that Schlick picked up the idea from his work on the new physics. But recent scholarship has demonstrated that, in fact, Schlick worked on the notion long before Einstein published the General Theory, and may well have been Einstein’s source for the notion (Engler 2009, 135ff). The important point in the present context is that the coordination of a single individual’s sense modalities is but the first step in the construction of the transcendent order. The next phase consists of the coordination of point-coincidences among different individuals. If an instructor wishes to draw attention to some feature of a triangle on a blackboard at the front of a class, he points to the feature, thus effecting a point-coincidence between the tip of his finger and the feature of the triangle. And even though everyone witnessing the demonstration has a different perspective, what they all share is their observation of the point-coincidence of fingertip and the geometric feature. Further, it is to be noted that not every sensory point-coincidence is an objective one, and not every objective point-coincidence is observed directly; it may be constructed or inferred from ones that are. Ultimately, all measurements, all determinations of space and time, are based on just such spatio-temporal point-coincidences. Schlick 1926 [1979]):

The important thing now is to get clear how we proceed from the intuitive spatio-temporal ordering to the construction of the transcendent ordering, This always happens in accordance with the same method, which we may call method of coincidences. It is of the greatest significance epistemologically. (Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 31, 272)

Earlier Schlick had argued that knowledge consists in the identification of that which is known with that as which it is known: in other words, knowledge consists in the relation of one thing to some other thing, as which it is known. And this is only achieved when one of the objects which is known is, in turn, related to still others, as it is in the myriad spatio-temporal relations in which it stands to other objects. Ultimately, all these relations can be known quantitatively by specifying a number of magnitudes, thus reducing the relations of the objective spatio-temporal order to quantities. Of course, this cannot be achieved within the qualitative order since the different relations of position and temporal order are qualitatively different and cannot, for that very reason, be compared. But the entities populating the objective spatio-temporal order are wholly unlike the denizens of the subjective realm which are the intuitive objects of experience, the immediately given sensory data. Both kinds of entities may be univocally designated by implicitly defined concepts, and both kinds of entities are therefore objects of possible knowledge. As such, intuitive contents are attributed full reality, and the objects populating the spatio-temporal order, the entities of advanced theoretical science, are just as real as the contents of consciousness with which they are correlated.

Schlick expended considerable effort discussing the differences between intuitive acquaintance and conceptual knowledge, insisting that, even though intuitive images are real, acquaintance with them does not constitute knowledge. This thesis directly confronts the idea, held by a number of philosophers, that acquaintance with intuitive contents is indeed a species of knowledge which is more direct and immediate than conceptual knowledge. In this regard Schlick pays tribute to Alois Riehl and Bertrand Russell, who do not conflate acquaintance (Kennen) and knowledge (Erkennen). (Ibid., 83). By comparison, scientific knowledge is regarded as a poor substitute, lacking the intimacy of intuitive acquaintance. Two champions of this belief are Henri Bergson, who thought that direct access to intuitive contents could (somehow) ‘unite’ the knower with the object known, and Edmund Husserl, who proposed that a genuinely philosophical intuition could become the basis of a kind of scientific cognition in which the subject is in direct contact with its object, without any symbolism or mathematics, any inferences or proofs (Bergson 1903 [1955]; Husserl 1910 [1965]). Bergson called this intimate perception of objects ‘intuition’ and Husserl called it ‘‘Wesensschau’ (insight into essences). But the reason why intuition can never constitute knowledge is quite obvious for Schlick. On his view, knowledge requires two terms: that which is known and that as which it is known. But intuition, considered as an act of consciousness, involves only that which is intuited. In short, the attempt to identify intuition as a form of knowledge is simply a conflation of knowledge with acquaintance, of unelaborated, direct perception or sensation with conceptual knowledge, of kennen with erkennen (Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 12).

Schlick’s discussion of the differences between intuition and knowledge laid the groundwork for his treatment of realism. He cautioned, at the outset of his discussion, that the question of realism is not a philosophical problem, but an everyday one. And the view that guides the comings and goings of ordinary life is naïve realism, which assumes that reality consists simply of the objects of sense perception. Of course, the demands of day-to-day affairs seldom require any distinction between the perception of an object and the object perceived, until one encounters an illusion which demands the differentiation of, say, a mirage from a puddle or pond. Only then is a representation first distinguished from its object. It is at this point that the ordinary person realizes that the mirage was real but that the pond or puddle was not. Thus refined, the naïve criterion of reality is extended beyond the reach of the senses once it is realized that, even when an object is not perceived, its effects provide a sufficient condition of its reality, as when a hunter finds a ravaged animal in the forest and concludes that a predator is in the neighborhood. And it is in precisely this way that naïve realism is naturally extended to include, not just perceptions themselves as well as the objects perceived, but also the causal sources of observed effects. In this way, naïve realism naturally leads to classical causal realism, or to a variant of structural realism (Neuber 2016, Neuber 2018).

In that case it simply becomes useful to refer to those objects which are not given in sensory experience – or at least not currently given – as ‘things-in-themselves’ since they are, by the causal criterion, real. Things-in-themselves are just the transcendent entities of the objective, three-dimensional world of everyday material objects, as well as the unobservable, theoretical entities postulated by contemporary science. Unsurprisingly, the reality of these entities is contested by a variety of related views, which Schlick classifies as ‘immanence’ philosophies. The most prominent immanence view is the kind of phenomenalism found in thinkers from John Stuart Mill to contemporaries like Joseph Petzoldt, Ernst Mach, and (as Schlick added in the second edition of General Theory) Bertrand Russell. More surprising, perhaps, is that Schlick also indicted his intellectual forbear, Hermann von Helmholtz, as an immanence philosopher. Basically, these thinkers all restrict reality to the given, so that reality consists exclusively of colors, tastes, and smells, as well as other sensations, presented in constantly changing combinations with one another. This is of course just to deny the reality of transcendent objects, thus abjuring the causal realism implicit in everyday and scientific talk of objects which exist and endure beyond momentary sensations. Instead, the immanence thinkers claim that all talk of transcendent objects consists entirely of discourse about complexes of sensations which exhibit more stability and constancy than others. Mach stated the common view of immanence philosophies that material bodies do not produce sensations, because bodies are, at bottom, nothing more than complexes of sensations (Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 25). Of course, immanence views differ among themselves in their attempts to identify which particular complexes of sensation are identified with everyday material bodies and scientific entities, especially when the latter are not perceived.

The classic immanence view is one which identifies material bodies with the combinations of sensations which would appear, in a given situation, if a perceiver were present. This is just John Stuart Mill’s definition of bodies as ‘permanent possibilities of sensation’ – a treatment which persists in the writings of many of his followers, in one form or another. For instance, Bertrand Russell, in Our Knowledge of the External World, calls the stable combinations ‘aspects’, declaring that “Things are those series of aspects which obey the laws of physics” (Russell 1922, 110). Specifically, Russell argued that so-called ‘ideal aspects’ – ones which are not presently perceived – may be logically constructed from those which are. Their reality may then be readily assumed. But with this assumption, any grounds for distinguishing between given aspects and assumed ones vanish, nor is there any means of recovering them without complicating the system beyond all recognition. Schlick noted that, because of Russell’s sheer audacity in pushing his account to the limit, the result is not prone to the inconsistencies which plague other accounts. Indeed, it is undeniable that Russell’s “bold position” is one of the most successful efforts to carry out immanence philosophy (Schlick 1918/1925 [2009, 502]). In a different vein, Joseph Petzoldt acknowledged that esse is not the same as percipii, though he then endeavored to identify the existence of objects with some limited group of sensations, a different group for each perceiver. In addition to the countless problems this approach encountered, the critical point which Petzoldt missed is that it is impossible to simply identify any particular sensation or group of sensations with a material body, without further conditions relating the sensation or sensations (as, for instance, Russell provided: Russell 1922: 106). And that is because it is lawful regularity among sensations which warrants the collection of the series of changing sensations under a single material body. Mach very nearly realized this when, in The Analysis of Sensations of 1886 he abandoned Mill’s ‘possibilities’ and replaced them with the mathematical notion of a functional relation. But such a purely mathematical idea can never be substituted for an empirically based concept of reality. Such attempts are, at bottom, attempts to conceptually embody a law, as epitomized in Helmholtz’s “The Conservation of Force: A Memoir” (Helmholtz 1977, 49–50). Specifically, Helmholtz identified the objective power of a law with force, thus reducing the reality of material bodies and scientific entities to a conceptual substitute. But concepts, according to Schlick, can never possess the reality of the contents of consciousness or transcendent things-in-themselves (Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 25, 26). With his critique of the notion of immanence and its proponents, who reject all variants of things-in-themselves as unknown, Schlick still documents his neo-Kantian commitment: “The non-representability of realities that are not given is thus no objection to their existence or to their knowability” (ibid., 233).

7. Transition to the Vienna Circle: Between Structural Realism and Linguistic Turn

Shortly after Schlick arrived in Vienna in 1922, he was invited by the mathematicians Hans Hahn and Kurt Reidemeister to participate in a seminar on Principia Mathematica by Alfred North Whitehead and Bertrand Russell. At the same time he became acquainted with Ludwig Wittgenstein’s Logisch-Philosophische Abhandlung / Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus (1921/1922). In 1924 Schlick organized (at the request of his students Herbert Feigl and Friedrich Waismann) an extra-curricular discussion group, which came to be called the ‘Schlick Circle’ and after 1929 the ‘Vienna Circle’. Their first reading was Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus (Stadler 2001 [2015], Chs. 3, 4, 6). Soon Schlick was writing to Wittgenstein (Dec.12, 1924), seeking additional copies of his work, telling him about the study group in Vienna, and requesting personal meetings. This was not successful because Wittgenstein had left philosophy behind and worked as a school teacher in Lower Austria before he returned to Vienna in 1926 working as an architect for a house of his sister Margaret. But after several failed attempts, Schlick finally arranged with Wittgenstein’s sister, Margaret Stonborough-Wittgenstein to visit him in early 1927 (McGuinness 1967, 14). The first clear evidence that Schlick had obtained a copy of the Tractatus, which he had been reading and studying since 1922, was in a letters of Ludwig Hänsel, January 10 and 25, 1925 (Hänsel-Wittgenstein 1994, 92), later being confirmed to Einstein in June of 1927 (Schlick 1927a). The following month Schlick effusively described the Tractatus as “the deepest” work of the new philosophy (Schlick 1927b). Over the next few years Schlick and Wittgenstein, mostly together with Waismann till 1934, met as time permitted up to 1936, carrying on philosophical discussions ranging over a broad array of topics, from the idea of geometry as syntax, to verificationist and operationalist theories of meaning, topics in logic and mathematics, and even solipsism.

From the beginning of their interaction Schlick was deeply impressed by the personality and philosophy of Wittgenstein. Inspired by the Tractatus he announced programmatically the linguistic “Turning Point in Philosophy” (1930) and praised the new “Future of Philosophy” (1930) in the spirit of Wittgenstein, who, by the way, was not pleased about the diction of these articles. Under this influence Schlick seems to have gradually forgotten his General Theory of Knowledge (1918/1925) and attributed to Wittgenstein insights like verificationism, the dualism of cognition (Erkennen) and experience (Erleben), the analytic-synthetic distinction, and structural, sign-oriented view of the meaning of truth, the tautological character of deductive inference, and the repudiation of psychologism, which he himself had already formulated in his book. With this commitment Schlick more or less represented the Wittgenstein faction with Waismann in the Vienna Circle in contrast to Hahn, Neurath, Menger, Gödel, and partly Canap. In the priority dispute between Wittgenstein and Carnap in 1932 concerning ostensive definition, natural law, hypotheses, and the formal mode vs. material of speech, Schlick mediated between them without success, while also seconding the latter against the accusations of the former (Stadler 2001, Ch.6.2.). As it turned out Schlick later on tried to reconcile his earlier critical realism and later linguistic turn in his concept of “consistent empiricism” (Schlick 1950). And with his Problems of Ethics (1930a) he consciously differed from Wittgenstein’s ethics, who in his “Lecture on Ethics” (written between 1929 and 1930, published in 1965) claimed again like in his Tractatus (1921/22, 6.42–6.422) that ethics cannot be a science because there are no moral facts for ethics to state . (Wittgenstein 1965). Recent research has uncovered that despite this strong influence of Wittgenstein’s linguistic turn there is more evidence of a continuity in Schlick’s philosophy of science from Rostock and Kiel to Vienna (Franke-Reddig 2026). In addition, there is new evidence on the complex and mutual relations between Wittgenstein and the Vienna Circle in general, and especially between Schlick, Waismann and Wittgenstein (see Heinrich-Ramharter, Pichler, & Stadler 2025, and Stadler 2023, where Rose Rand’s document “Development of the 27 Theses of Vienna Circle 1932/33” with reference to Wittgenstein’s Tractatus is analyzed in detail).

Wittgenstein dictated some of his thoughts to Schlick, including a strident verificationist series of remarks, and also shared several manuscripts with Schlick, including (perhaps) his so-called ‘Big Typescript’ of 1932–1933 (Iven 2009, Wittgenstein 2005). Several other documents survive from the period, particularly notes taken by Waismann when he accompanied Schlick on his visits to Wittgenstein (McGuinness 1967, 2010). In addition, there were joint travels undertaken by Wittgenstein and Schlick during the period of their interaction. The principal effect of this influence on Schlick was the assimilation into his already well-defined philosophical views of insights stimulated by these conversations, although Schlick kept an independent position till the end of his life (Stadler 2001 [2015], Ch. 6; Stadler 2023, Chs. 1, 13). This is confirmed by Herbert Feigl, Schlick’s former favorite student, in his introduction to the translation of Schlick’s General Theory of Knowledge (1974, xxii) with regard to the monistic solution of the mind-body problem: “The core of Schlick’s solution of the mind-body problem is a form of what today is called the ‘identity theory’, or, more precisely, a ‘psycho-neural’ identity theory. It is fundamentally different from logical behaviorism and radical materialism, …, as well as pan-psychism”. In the tradition of Alois Riehl and Richard Avenarius it anticipates by at least eleven years Russell’s later views, first formulated in Analysis of Matter (1927) and is compatible with American critical realists like C.A. Strong, later with Feigl’s own position in The ‘Mental’ and the ‘Physical’ (1967). Feigl further mentions achievements of Schlick like implicit definitions, the analytic-synthetic distinction, along with a decisive criticism of Kant’s synthetic a priori, leading up to his ‘Form and Content’ (1932).

During the same period Rudolf Carnap joined the Faculty of Philosophy of the University of Vienna as well as the Schlick Circle. He brought a manuscript with him, which he called “Konstitutionstheorie”, and which was eventually published, with Schlick’s help, as Der Logische Aufbau der Welt (later translated as The Logical Structure of the World: Carnap 1928 [1967]). . It was at this time that Schlick penned the essay “Erleben, Erkennen, Metaphysik” (“Experience, Cognition, and Metaphysics”, 1926 [1979]), which represents a particularly important juncture in his thinking. Schlick attempted to link current influences on his thought – Wittgenstein’s Tractatus and Carnap’s Aufbau – with his earlier ideas, especially the distinction between intuitions and concepts (Schlick 2008, 33–56; Wittgenstein 1921 [1961]; Carnap 1928 [1967]; Schlick 1918/1925 [1974], Sec. 7).

Within a few years, Schlick wrote the essays which are characteristic of his early “positivist” thought. The first, “Die Wende der Philosophie” (“The Turning Point in Philosophy”) appeared in 1930. It contains an early version of the thesis that the function of philosophy is the linguistic analysis of meaning (Schlick 1930 [1979, 154–160]). A more decisive article was “Positivismus und Realismus” (“Positivism and Realism”, 1932 [1948]), a classic piece also as a reply to his former teacher Max Planck, which shaped some of the most characteristic philosophical work to emerge from the pre-Vienna tradition (Schlick 1979b, 259–284). Schlick interprets the verifiability principle strictly, by spelling out verification in terms of sensory experience, but at the same time broadly construed to admit any logically conceivable circumstances of verification (like the future verification of mountains on the far side of the moon). The basis of this principle, Schlick argues, is to be found in scientific practice. He cites Einstein’s analysis of the concept of time with regard to the meaning of our assertions on “simultaneity” in Special Relativity as his primary example, an illustration which would become a staple of his scientific philosophy. In this regard he mentioned Planck, who acknowledged that experience was the source of scientific knowledge. Schlick called the philosophical view founded on this principle “Logical Positivism”, using the designation introduced by A. E. Blumberg and Herbert Feigl (Blumberg and Feigl 1931). As Schlick explained it, this doctrine is essentially a realist epistemology, like the one developed in his General Theory of Knowledge, which shares little with classical positivism from Auguste Comte to Hans Vaihinger. Just for this reason Schlick offered the alternate notion of “consistent empiricism” (konsequenter Empirismus) as follows (Ch.10):

The principle, that the meaning of every proposition is exhaustively determined by its verification of the given, seems to me a legitimate, unassailable core of the ‘positivist’ school of thought. But within those schools it has seldom come clearly to light, and has often be mingled with so many untenable principles, that a logical clean up is necessary. If we want to call the result of this clean-up ‘positivism’, …, we should, perhaps, to affix a differentiating adjective: the term ‘logical’ or ‘logistic positivism’ is often used. Otherwise the expression ‘consistent empiricism’ has seemed to me appropriate. (Schlick 1932, 283)

Schlick’s principal conclusion was that this philosophy never denies the reality of material objects, but rather equates physical reality with the lawfulness of experience. Unfortunately, Planck, who had always supported Schlick in the past, misunderstood the essay, interpreting it as a plea for Machian doctrines, and condemned it harshly (Planck 1932).

8. Linguistic Foundations of Science – The Protocol Sentence Controversy

The celebrated ‘protocol sentence controversy’ in the Vienna Circle was motivated by Carnap’s syntactic analysis of observation sentences, or ‘protocols’ (Carnap 1932a [1934]). The salient feature of Carnap’s analysis was its ‘syntacticism’, the idea that meaning is wholly a function of the serial arrangements of symbols. Naturally, syntacticism precludes any effort to explain protocols by their relation to experiences, sensory impressions, or observations. Otto Neurath had rejected Carnap’s phenomenalistic methodological solipsism in the Aufbau, arguing that protocols should be understood physicalistically, as sentences of the physical language, and that their origins and grounds are to be explicated naturalistically, via detectable behavior (Uebel 2007, esp. ch. 8). But Schlick recoiled at the very idea that the relation between observation sentences and what they describe should be explicated by any means other than philosophical analysis. So, in his classic 1934 essay “Über das Fundament der Erkenntnis” (“On the Foundations of Knowledge”) he introduced so-called ‘affirmations’ (Konstatierungen) with the aim of explicating the relation between physicalistic protocols and the personal experiences on which they are grounded (Schlick 1979b, 370–387): he claimed that affirmations (‘here now blue’) are different from the related protocol sentences (‘on such-and-such date in April 1934, at such-and-such time and place Schlick perceived blue’), for the latter proposition is a hypothesis with uncertainty. And he concludes: “In protocol,sentences the reference is always the perceptions …. while in affirmations they are never mentioned. A genuine affirmation cannot be written down, for as soon as I put down the demonstrative terms ‘here’ and ‘now’, they loose their meaning ” (Ibid., 386).

Neurath responded in his 1934 essay “Radical Physicalism and the ‘Real World’”, condemning Schlick’s view as just so much metaphysics, while Carnap regarded affirmations as protocols of a phenomenal language, along the lines of one of the alternatives he had outlined in his 1932 paper “On Protocol Sentences” (Neurath 1983, 66; Carnap 1932b [1987, 458–463]). Carnap objected that unless Schlick could explain how affirmations might be translated into sentences of the physical language, then affirmations violated the thesis of physicalism. Schlick responded that affirmations, like “Here now white”, were the responses of investigators when asked about their personal experiences in experimental situations. Thus construed, the demonstrative character of affirmations ensures their incorrigibility (Schlick 1918/1925 [2009, 661–674]). Although their demonstrative character prevents them from being regarded as proper physicalistic sentences, they are obviously translatable into statements of physical language. But then, even though they lose their distinctive epistemic character, for they are no longer incorrigible or indubitable, they still convey epistemic warrant to their physicalistic translations:

If we look on science as a system of propositions, …, then the question of the foundation, which in that case would be a ‘logical’ one, can be answered as we please, for we are free to define the foundation at will. In an abstract proposition-system, after all, there is intrinsically no priority and no posteriority. The most general propositions of science, i.e., those which are most commonly selected as ‘axioms’, could be designated, for example, as its ultimate foundation.; but the name could equally well be reserved for the most specific propositions at all, which would then in fact actually correspond to the protocols written down; or some other choice would be possible. But the propositions of science are one and all hypotheses, the moment they are seen from the standpoint of their truth-value, or validity. If we turn our attention to the connection of science with reality … then the problem of the ‘foundation’ will automatically transform itself into the unshakeable points of contact between knowledge and reality. (Schlick 1979b, 386f.)

Schlick’s affirmations are presented in the context of a correspondence theory of his ‘consistent empiricism’. But to Carnap, the deeper problem was that, by the lights of his 1934 work on The Logical Syntax of Language, affirmations are not well-formed expressions at all. Earlier, in his 1932 contribution to the protocol sentence controversy, Carnap’s treatment of observation was based on the Metalogic Thesis, the idea that all philosophical contentions (which are not nonsense) are metalinguistic claims about linguistic expressions and their logical (particularly syntactical) properties (Carnap 1932a [1934], 435n). The function of the Metalogic Thesis was to isolate pseudo-theses or statements which seem to concern substantive matters but are really concerned with logical or linguistic matters. These pseudo-theses became known as ‘pseudo-object sentences’ and their analysis became a centerpiece of Carnap’s Logical Syntax-era philosophy (Carnap 1934 [1937], Sec. 74). And the Metalogic Thesis, together with the Principle of Tolerance (which asserts that the choice of any specific logic and language is a conventional decision), formed the principal theses of Carnap’s philosophy of logic in the 1930s (Carnap 1934 [1937, 51–52]). Otto Neurath, who endorsed the Metalogic Thesis and the Tolerance Principle, drew the obvious conclusion that Schlick’s defense of the correspondence conception of truth, explicated by his analysis of affirmations, committed him to the recognition of “the one, true reality” and “the real world” (Neurath 1983, 106–108; Uebel 2007, Sec. 8.2). In short, Schlick’s foundations were spelled out in nothing more than philosophical pseudo-statements. (On the context of these debates see the correspondence between Carnap and Neurath [Carnap and Neurath 2024] and the Carnap Diaries [Carnap 2022].) The protocol sentence debate uncovers the split between a “left wing” (Carnap, Hahn, Neurath) and a more traditional one in the Vienna Circle (Schlick, Waismann), which became manifest in the diverse reception of Wittgenstein (Uebel 2007, Stadler 2023).

What Neurath and (presumably) Carnap both missed was that Schlick’s thinking about meaning and linguistic significance had come a long way since his 1926 essay on “Experience, Cognition, and Metaphysics”, in which he tried to link Wittgenstein’s remarks about internal relations in the Tractatus with his own doctrine of implicit definition (Wittgenstein 1921 [1961], 4.122, 4.125, 4.1251, 5.232). There the goal was to apply both these ideas to the distinction between intuitions and concepts. The result seemed to be a failure. For it implied what Schlick called “the incommunicability of contents”, the idea that non-formal contents, like the greenness of the color green or the distinctive smell of wood smoke, must forever remain ineffable (Oberdan 1996, Sec. 2). But it was not long before Schlick’s efforts to explain linguistic meaning and scientific knowledge in terms of their ‘form’ and ‘content’ were abandoned, and by the 1934–1935 academic year he was developing what might well be called ‘a semantic conception’, spelled out in terms of grammars and the rules which constitute them, and presenting his new vision of language in his lectures on Logik und Erkenntnistheorie (Schlick 1934–5 [2019]).

9. Grammar and Meaning

In Logik und Erkenntnistheorie (Schlick 1934–5 [2019, 337–640]) Schlick – certainly inspired by conversations with Wittgenstein (McGuinness 1967, 2010; Baker 2003) – thought the most important component of languages was grammatical rules, which are of two kinds. First of all, there are ‘internal rules’, which govern the use of expressions in relation to other expressions, much like the formation and transformation rules of formal logic. In addition, Schlick conceived of a second type of grammatical rule, which he called ‘application-rules’ (Anwendungsregeln), regulating the use of expressions in connection with, or application to, observable extra-linguistic situations. Of course, application rules govern not only descriptions of observable situations, but the use of indexicals and demonstratives as well, thus legitimizing Schlick’s affirmations by grounding them in grammar. And Schlick conceived grammar with sufficient breadth to encompass the natural languages of everyday life as well as the technical and highly regimented languages of science. Concurring with Carnap’s Principle of Tolerance, Schlick regarded the choice of grammatical rules, the choice of a particular grammar rather than an alternative, as conventional and therefore independent of extra-linguistic matters. And his endorsement of grammatical conventionalism was specifically intended to accommodate choices between languages which differed radically, as demonstrated in his treatment of philosophical pseudo-problems (Oberdan 1996, Sec. 3).

Schlick presented his latest conception of grammar and its application to philosophical pseudo-problems in his 1936 essay on “Meaning and Verification” (Schlick 1979b, 456–481). In particular, he demonstrated that the criterion of verifiability is rooted in grammar and concerns any grammatically well-formed proposition which is neither analytic nor contradictory. He reiterated his conception of grammar as the collection of rules governing the formation and use of meaningful expressions, including the rules governing the use of language in connection with experience, rules which are introduced by acts of ostension (Schlick 1979b, 464–467). Although the result is an analysis of language which provides a powerful treatment of many ‘typical’ metaphysical theses, like Platonism, psychologism, and phenomenalism, in “Meaning and Verification” Schlick demonstrated its utility by applying it to solipsism. The upshot is that solipsism is a contingent truth which is treated by its defenders as unfalsifiable. But statements which are insulated from the possibility of falsification are object-language ‘mis-expressions’ of what are, at bottom, grammatical rules. The parallel with Carnap’s analysis of pseudo-object sentences as metalinguistic assertions rather than ‘real-object’ sentences could not be more striking. And just as Carnap regarded the formal translations of philosophical theses as proposals to adopt a certain language form, Schlick contended that the solipsist’s thesis was not a bona fide contingent claim but simply an attempt to introduce a particular mode of speech. Thus, by the time of “Meaning and Verification” he had moved well beyond his ‘Form and Content’ stage, modulating his earlier thinking, to arrive at a more mature and balanced conception of the issues at the focus of his philosophical concerns (Oberdan 1996, Sec. 5). This development is embedded in the unresolved discussion between Carnap, Neurath and Schlick with diverging positions regarding syntax, semantics, physicalism and verificationism in the 1930s (Uebel 2007).

10. From Theoretical to Practical Philosophy: Covering Nature and Culture

The discussions of verifiability in the late 1920s led to widespread disputes in later Vienna Circle meetings and publications. But even in the early years Schlick and his students wondered how ethical statements might be verifiable, given their apparent lack of cognitive meaning and truth-values (meta-ethical noncognitivism or emotivism). In Fragen der Ethik (1930) Schlick attempted to interpret ethical statements as empirical claims about the means for maximizing happiness. Relying on relative judgments of values, Schlick argued that an empirical foundation of an ethical system is based on the regulative principle of joy and happiness. On Schlick’s account, happiness is not to be construed superficially but as the elated sense of fulfillment that accompanies actions carried out for their own sake. Furthermore, contrary to Kant’s categorical imperative, there are no a priori moral statements fixing absolute moral values. With accepting meaningful moral statements of an empirical kind, Schlick also deviates from Wittgenstein and some other members of the Vienna Circle. This practical philosophy on the road from Germany to Vienna needs to be highlighted in more detail (Stadler 2006).

With his appointment to the Chair of Natural Philosophy at Vienna in 1922 Schlick worked on modern natural sciences (relativity theory and quantum physics) on the one hand, but at the same time increasingly devoted himself to ethics, culture and history, in reaction to the rise of fascism. Already in his inaugural lecture of 1922, he formulated his preference for a scientific philosophy that encompassed all sub-disciplines. After an appreciation of Mach’s unification of the historical and philosophical perspective with natural science he claims:

Philosophy following the strict thinking methods of exact science must fail. Scientific philosophy, which despises the contrast to natural science and its method of cautious empirical research, must fail; there is no more convenient way to solve the greatest questions of knowledge than through the individual sciences. Not a royal road … Orientation towards exact thinking does not mean: restriction to those areas of philosophy that are obviously and directly related to natural science, physics and biology, but treating all philosophical disciplines with equal love, but sub specie naturae, philosophy of history as well as epistemology, aesthetics as well as ethics. (Schlick 2019, 371–377; quoted and transl. by Stadler 2019, 191)

There are different accounts of Schlick’s unfinished philosophical oeuvre, ranging from continuity to rupture, but an authentic source is his posthumously published third-person self-portrayal in the Philosophen-Lexikon. Handwörterbuch der Philosophie, which was written in the 1930s (ibid.):

Schlick attempts to establish and develop a consistent and completely pure empiricism. … From there, with the help of an analysis of the process of cognition, the Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre first arrives at a clear separation of the rational from the empirical, the conceptual from the intuitional. Concepts are mere signs that are assigned to the world to be cognized; they appear in the ‘statements’ in a very specific order, and these are thus able to ‘express’ certain structures of reality. Every statement is the expression of a fact and represents a cognition insofar as it describes a new fact with the help of old signs, i.e. through a new combination of otherwise already used concepts. The order of reality … is established solely through experience, so there is only empirical knowledge. The so-called rational truths, therefore, the purely conceptual propositions such as the logical-mathematical … are nothing but rules of signs that determine the syntax of the language (L. Wittgenstein) in which we speak of the world. They have a purely analytical-tautological character and therefore contain no knowledge; they say nothing about reality, but precisely for this reason they can be applied to any fact of the world. Thus, by its very nature, knowledge consists in a reproduction of the order, the structure of the world; the substance or content that possesses this structure cannot enter into it; for what is expressed is precisely not the expressed itself. It would therefore be a nonsensical beginning to want to express the ‘content’ itself. This is the verdict of all metaphysics; for this is precisely what it has always wanted by setting itself the goal of recognizing the actual ‘essence of being’. (Schlick 1950, p. 462f.)

After these epistemological statements, Schlick continues programmatically:

In aesthetics and ethics, strict empiricism leads to the conclusion that it makes no sense to speak of ‘absolute’ values; only the evaluative behaviors actually found in people can be the subject of investigation. From this point of view, a new justification of a kind of eudaemonism emerges, the moral principle of which is roughly: Increase your happiness!

Here the combination of structural realism and radical empiricism becomes obvious, as well as a challenge of a strict non-cognitivism prevalent in the Vienna Circle (ethical statements or norms do not have truth conditions) Schlick’s ethics combines a psychological, empirical ethics and a (anti-Kantian) meta-ethics within a hedonistic frame to be chosen (Schlick 1930a; Siegetsleitner 2022; Ferrari 2023). In this self-portrayal we also recognize a thematic connection from his early Glückseligkeitslehre (1908) and his later Fragen der Ethik (1930) through to his posthumously published ethical writings inspired by both evolutionary theory and German philosophy of life following Nietzsche, Dilthey, and Scheler (Schlick 1952, 2013, 2024). And Schlick concludes his self-description emphatically on the subject of the new role of philosophy:

Philosophy is not a science, although it permeates all sciences. While the latter consist of systems of true propositions and contain knowledge, philosophy consists in seeking the meaning of propositions and creates understanding that leads to wisdom. (Ibid.)

Schlick therefore claims no epistemological priority with regard to philosophy of nature or culture, nor with regard to theoretical or practical philosophy. According to him, ethics and aesthetics can also be pursued within the project of what he called “consistent empiricism”. We are thus dealing with an “ethics of goodness” vs. an absolute “ethics of duty” (Kant). This encompasses philosophy and psychology (as individual epicureanism), which contrasts an individual eudaimonism with the categorical imperative. Schlick thus provides inspiration for philosophical activity and a contribution to psychological insight, as can be seen in the questions raised in the table of contents of his Fragen der Ethik (Schlick 1930a/1939): What is the aim of ethics? What are the motives of human conduct? What is egoism? What is the meaning of “moral”? Are there absolute values? Are there worthless joys and valuable sorrows? When is man responsible? What paths lead to value?

The clear conclusion of Schlick is that moral action is either not possible at all or arises from natural inclinations. This position is already present in his monograph Vom Sinn des Lebens (Schlick 1927c [1979], cited in Schlick 2008, 125), where he summarizes in the spirit of Schiller and the German youth movement: “If we need a rule of life, let it be this: ‘Preserve the spirit of youth’, for it is the meaning of life”, which lies in active play as an end in itself. His philosophy of nature and culture, as well as his ethics can also be illustrated by his extensive aphorisms, only a small part of which were published posthumously by Schlick’s widow Blanche Hardy-Schlick (Schlick 1962). Overall, they serve as evidence of his anti-metaphysical and anti-totalitarian world view situated between naturalism and humanism.

11. Early Death – The Assassination in 1936

On the way to his lecture course on June 22, 1936, in the main building of the University of Vienna, Schlick was shot four times in the legs and abdomen by Johann Nelböck, a former philosophy student who had been threatening him for several years. In fact, Nelböck had been confined to an asylum for observation and diagnosed as a paranoid schizophrenic. Eventually it emerged that other factors – social, ideological and political – may also have influenced Nelböck. The number of possible motivations – inter alia anti-Semitism (although Schlick was not a Jew) and defense of metaphysics – make it hard to fully understand what was in Nelböck’s mind at the time. But the result of his misdeed is clear: with the death of Moritz Schlick, philosophy lost one of its most creative and promising thinkers at the age of 54 years. (See Stadler 2013, 207–238; Stadler 2001 [2015], Part 2, ch.13; Sigmund 2015 [2017]; and Edmonds 2020, for a comprehensive account of Schlick’s death and its context.)

To summarize: after his dissertation with Max Planck, the physicist-philosopher Schlick increasingly devoted himself to practical philosophy as a counterpart to his turn towards natural philosophy, including the interpretation of the theory of relativity and quantum physics. This was already evident during his time in Rostock and Kiel and intensified after his appointment to the Vienna Chair of “Philosophy of Nature” in 1922, as can be seen from his lecture courses, talks and publications. This arc stretches from his book Lebensweisheit (1908) to his Fragen der Ethik (1930) with his involvement in the Vienna Ethical Society. Before his untimely death Schlick worked on an unfinished book manuscript entitled Natur, Kultur, Kunst (Nature, Culture, Arts), in which he intended to correlate these diverse topics with the monistic conclusion: “Art is a desire for nature. Culture is a bridge on both ends of which nature rests” (Schlick forthcoming).

The aim was a fundamental philosophical penetration of all scientific disciplines, but the motivation for this comprehensive philosophy lay also in the increasing rise of totalitarianism, against which Schlick took a stand to the end of his life. His individual epicureanism and political liberalism represented an alternative to the anti-democratic zeitgeist, which was ultimately the background for his assassination in 1936. In this respect, Schlick was both a sensitive seismograph of his times and a victim of the violent forces of the interwar period. His murder was a sign of an inhumane society heading for the final destruction of the First Republic and the expulsion of scientific philosophy, of which Schlick had been one of the leading representatives as founder and leader of the Vienna Circle. Since that time there has been increasing interest in Schlick’s short life’s work, with a “back to Schlick” impetus focusing on his main works as well as unfinished and incomplete writings (beginning with Haller 1982; Gadol 1982; McGuinness 1985 up to the running Moritz Schlick Edition, MSGA, since 2006ff.).

Bibliography

Works by Moritz Schlick

Note: The entire corpus of Schlick’s published and unpublished writings has been or will be published as Moritz Schlick Gesamtausgabe, abbreviated as MSGA in this entry, under the general editorship of Friedrich Stadler (Vienna, until 2024) and Hans Jürgen Wendel (Rostock), running at the Moritz Schlick Forschungsstelle at the University of Rostock, currently directed by Matthias Wunsch. The volumes of this historical-critical edition have already established new editorial standards. The German book series Schlick-Studien (Vienna, New York: Springer 2009–) and Schlickiana (Berlin: Parerga 2008–) should also be mentioned.

  • Schlick, Moritz, 1904 [2006], Über die Reflexion des Lichtes in einer inhomogenen Schicht & Raum und Zeit in der gegenwärtigen Physik, Fynn Ole Engler and Matthias Neuber (eds.), Vienna: Springer, 2006 (MSGA I/2).
  • –––, 1908 [2006], Lebensweisheit: Versuch einer Glückseligkeitslehre, Munich: Beck; in Schlick 2006.
  • –––, 1915, “Die philosophische Bedeutung des Relativitätsprinzips”, Zeitschrift für Philosophie und philosophische Kritik, 159: 129–175.
  • –––, 1917a, “Raum und Zeit in der gegenwärtigen Physik. Zur Einführung in das Verständnis der allgemeinen Relativitätstheorie”, Die Naturwissenschaften, 5: 161–167, 177–186.
  • –––, 1917b [1963], Raum und Zeit in der gegenwärtigen Physik. Zur Einführung in das Verständnis der allgemeinen Relativitätstheorie, Berlin: Springer; further enlarged German editions: 1919, 1920, 1922; Henry L. Brose (trans.), Space and Time in Contemporary Physics, Oxford & New York 1920; reprinted 1963.
  • –––, 1918/1925 [1974], Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre, Berlin: Springer; Albert E. Blumberg (trans.), General Theory of Knowledge, with an introduction by Albert E. Blumberg and Herbert Feigl, Vienna & New York: Springer, 1974.
  • –––, 1918/1925 [2009], Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre, H. J. Wendel and F. O. Engler (eds.), Vienna: Springer, 2009 (MSGA I/1).
  • –––, 1920a, Letter to Hans Reichenbach, September 25, 1920, Archives for Scientific Philosophy, No. 015–63–23.
  • –––, 1920b, Letter to Hans Reichenbach, November 26, 1920, Archives for Scientific Philosophy, No. 015–63–22.
  • –––, 1921, Herrmann von Helmholtz, Schriften zur Erkenntnistheorie, hrsg. und erläutert von Paul Hertz und Moritz Schlick, Berlin: Springer.
  • –––, 1922, “Helmholtz als Erkenntnistheoretiker”, Helmholtz als Physiker, Physiologe und Philosoph, Karlsruhe: Müllersche Hofbuchhandlung, 29–39.
  • –––, 1926 [1979], “Erleben, Erkennen, Metaphysik”, Kant-Studien, 31: 146–158; English translation, “Experience, Cognition, and Metaphysics”, in Schlick 1979a, 99–111.
  • –––, 1927a, Letter to Albert Einstein, June 5, 1927, Einstein Collection, Hebrew University (EC 21–596).
  • –––, 1927b, Letter to Albert Einstein, July 14, 1927. Einstein Collection, Hebrew University (EC 21–599).
  • –––, 1927c [1979], “Vom Sinn des Lebens”, Symposion. Philosophische Zeitschrift für Forschung und Aussprache, 1: 331–354; English translation, “On the Meaning of Life”, in Schlick 1979b, 112–129.
  • –––, 1930a, Fragen der Ethik (= Schriften zur wissenschaftlichen Weltauffassung, Volume 4, Philipp Frank and Moritz Schlick (eds.), Vienna: Springer; David Rynin (trans.), Problems of Ethics, New York, 1939, reprinted 1961, 1962; German edition, Rainer Hegselmann (ed.), Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp 1984; also in Schlick 2006 (MSGA I/3).
  • –––, 1930b [1979], “Die Wende der Philosophie”, Erkenntnis, 1 (1): 4–11: in Schlick 1979b, 154–160.
  • –––, 1930c [1979], “The Future of Philosophy”, in Schlick 1979b, 171–175.
  • –––, 1932 [1948], “Positivismus und Realismus”, Erkenntnis, 3: 1–31; David Rynin (trans.), “Positivism and Realism”, Synthese, 7(1) (1948): 478–505.
  • –––, 1934–5 [2019], Logik und Erkenntnistheorie. Vorlesungen 1934–1935, The Vienna Circle Foundation, Haarlem: Rijksarchief voor Noord-Holland; published in Vorlesungen und Aufzeichnungen zur Logik und Philosophie der Mathematik, eds. Martin Lemke and Anne-Sophie Naujoks, Wiesbaden: Springer 2019 (MSGA II/1.3).
  • –––, 1950, “Moritz Schlick” (Selbstdarstellung), in Werner Ziegenfuss and Gertrud Jung (eds.), Philosophen-Lexikon. Handwörterbuch der Philosophie nach Personen, Berlin: Walter de Gruyter & Co., Volume 2, 462 ff.
  • –––, 1952, Natur und Kultur, Josef Rauscher (ed.), Vienna: Humboldt Verlag.
  • –––, 1962, Aphorismen, Blanche Hardy-Schlick (ed.), Vienna: Eigenverlag.
  • –––, 1979a, Philosophical Papers (Volume I: 1909–1922), H. L. Mulder and B. F. van de Velde-Schlick (eds.), Dordrecht: D. Reidel.
  • –––, 1979b, Philosophical Papers (Volume II: 1925–1936), H. L. Mulder and B. F. van de Velde-Schlick (eds.), Dordrecht: D. Reidel.
  • –––, 2006, Lebensweisheit: Versuch einer Glückseligkeitslehre & Fragen der Ethik, Mathias Iven (ed.), Vienna: Springer (MSGA I/3).
  • –––, 2008, Die Wiener Zeit: Aufsätze, Beitrage, Rezensionen 1926–1936, Johannes Friedl and Heiner Rutte (eds.), Vienna: Springer (MSGA I/6).
  • –––, 2012, Rostock, Kiel, Wien: Aufsätze, Beiträge, Rezensionen 1919–1925, Edwin Glassner, Heidi König-Porstner, and K. Böger (eds.), Vienna: Springer (MSGA I/5).
  • –––, 2013, Nietzsche und Schopenhauer, Mathias Iven (ed.), Vienna: Springer (MSGA II/5.1).
  • –––, 2019, Naturphilosophische Schriften. Manuskripte 1910–1936, Nicole Kutzner and Michael Pohl (eds.), Wiesbaden: Springer (MSGA II/2.1).
  • –––, 2024, Vorlesungen, Vorträge und Fragmente zur Ethik, Friederike Peters (ed.), Wiesbaden: Springer (MSGA II/3.2).
  • –––, forthcoming, “Staat und Kultur” (A 110 / A87a, b, Vienna Circle Foundation, Haarlem), in: Philosophie der Natur, Kultur und Geschichte, Friedrich Stadler und Bastian Stoppelkamp, (eds.) Cham: Springer.

Other Works

  • Baker, Gordon (ed.), 2003, The Voices of Wittgenstein. The Vienna Circle, Ludwig Wittgenstein and Friedrich Waismann, London and New York: Routledge.
  • Bergson, Henri, 1903 [1955], “Introduction à la métaphysique”, Revue de métaphysique et de morale, 11 (1): 1–36; T. E. Hulme (trans.), An Introduction to Metaphysics, second edition, Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill.
  • Blumberg, Albert E., and Herbert Feigl, 1931, “Logical Positivism: A New Movement in European Philosophy”, Journal of Philosophy, 28: 281–296.
  • Carnap, Rudolf, 1928 [1967], Der logische Aufbau der Welt, Berlin: Benary; R. A. George (trans.), The Logical Structure of the World, Berkeley: University of California Press.
  • –––, 1932a [1934], “Die Physikalische Sprache als Universalsprache der Wissenschaft”, Erkenntnis, 2: 432–465; M. Black (trans.), The Unity of Science, London: Kegan Paul.
  • –––, 1932b [1987], “Über Protokollsätze”, Erkenntnis, 3: 215–228; R. Creath and R. Nollan (trans.), “On Protocol Sentences”, Noûs, 1 (1987): 457–470.
  • –––, 1934 [1937], Logische Syntax der Sprache, Vienna: Springer; Amethe Smeaton (trans.), The Logical Syntax of Language, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
  • –––, 2022, Tagebücher, 2 volumes, Christian Damböck (ed.), Hamburg: Meiner.
  • Carnap, Rudolf, and Otto Neurath, 2024, Briefwechsel, Christian Damböck, Johannes Friedl, and Ulf Höfer (eds.), Hamburg: Meiner.
  • Cassirer, Ernst, 1910 [1923], Substanzbegriff und Funktionsbegriff. Untersuchungen über die Grundfragen der Erkenntniskritik, Berlin: Bruno Cassirer; W. and M. Swabey (trans.), Substance and Function, Chicago: Open Court.
  • –––, 1921 [1923], Zur Einsteinschen Relativitätstheorie. Erkenntnistheoretische Betrachtungen, Berlin: Bruno Cassirer; translated as Einstein’s Theory of Relativity, Chicago: Open Court.
  • Coffa, Alberto J., 1991, The Semantic Tradition from Kant to Carnap, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Cohen, Hermann, 1885, Kants Theorie der Erfahrung, Berlin: Harwitz.
  • Edmonds, David, 2020, The Murder of Professor Schlick: The Rise and Fall of the Vienna Circle, Princeton and Oxford: Princeton University Press.
  • Einstein, Albert, 1916 [2008], “Die Grundlage der allgemeinen Relativitätstheorie”, Annalen der Physik, 49(7): 769–822; translated as “The Foundation of the General Theory of Relativity”, in The Principle of Relativity, Aventura, FL: BN Publishing, pp. 111–164.
  • –––, 1920, Letter to Moritz Schlick, April 19, 1920, Einstein Collection, Hebrew University, EC 21633; published in Engler, Iven, and Renn 2022, 30.
  • –––, 1921, Letter to Moritz Schlick, August 10, 1921, Einstein Collection, Hebrew University; published in Engler, Iven, and Renn 2022, 59.
  • Engler, Fynn Ole, 2009, “Über das erkenntnistheoretische Raumproblem”, in Stadler et al. 2009, 107–145.
  • Engler, Fynn Ole, Mathias Iven, and Jürgen Renn, (eds). 2022, Albert Einstein/Moritz Schlick: Briefwechsel, Hamburg: Meiner.
  • Feigl, Herbert, 1967, The ‘Mental’ and the ‘Physical’, with a Postscript after Ten Years, Minneapolis: University of Minneapolis Press.
  • –––, and Albert Blumberg, 1974, “Introduction”, in Moritz Schlick, General Theory of Knoweldge, Vienna, New York: Springer, xviii–xxv.
  • Ferrari, Massimo, 2009, “1922: Moritz Schlick in Wien”, in Stadler et al. 2009, 17–62.
  • –––, 2002, “An Unknown Side of Schlick’s Intellectual Biography: The Reviews for the Vierteljahresschrift für wissenschaftliche Philosophie und Soziologie (1911–1916)”, in Friedrich Stadler (ed.), The Vienna Circle and Logical Empiricism, Vienna, New York: Springer, 63–76.
  • –––, 2023, “After the Tractatus: Schlick and Wittgenstein on Ethics”, in Stadler 2023, 127–160.
  • Franke-Reddig, Julia, 2026. Zur Kontinuität und Eigenständigkeit der Wissenschaftsphilosophie von Moritz Schlick, Cham: Springer.
  • Friedman, Michael, 1997, “Helmholtz’s Zeichentheorie and Schlick’s Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre: Early Logical Empiricism and its Nineteenth-Century Background”, Philosophical Topics, 25: 19–50.
  • –––, 1999, Reconsidering Logical Positivism, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 2010, “Synthetic History Re-Considered”, in M. Domski and M. Dickson (eds.), Discourse on a New Method, Chicago: Open Court, 571–813.
  • Gadol, Eugene T. (ed.), 1982, Rationality and Science. A Memorial Volume for Moritz Schlick in Celebration of the Centennial of his Birth, Vienna & New York: Springer.
  • Haller, Rudolf (ed.), 1982, Schlick und Neurath. Ein Symposium, Amsterdam: Rodopi.
  • Heidelberger, Michael, 2022, “Hermann von Helmholtz and Logical Empiricism”, in Uebel and Limbeck-Lilienau 2022, 53–61.
  • Heinrich-Ramharter, Esther, Alois Pichler, and Friedrich Stadler (eds.), 2025, 100 Years of Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus – 70 Years after Wittgenstein’s Death, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Helmholtz, Hermann. 1867 [1924–1925], Handbuch der physiologischen Optik, Leipzig: Leopold Voss; translated as Treatise on Physiological Optics (3 volumes), Milwaukee: Optical Society of America.
  • –––, 1878 [1977], “On the Facts of Perception”, in Helmholtz 1977, 115–185.
  • –––, 1971, Selected Writings of Hermann von Helmholtz, Russell Kahl (ed.), Middletown: Wesleyan University Press.
  • –––, 1977, Epistemological Writings, R. S. Cohen and Y. Elkana (eds.), Dordrecht: D. Reidel.
  • Hänsel, Ludwig – Wittgenstein, Ludwig, 1994, Ludwig Hänsel – Ludwig Wittgenstein. Eine Freundschaft. Briefe. Aufsätze. Kommentare, I. Somavilla, A. Unterkircher, Chr. P. Berger unter der Leitung von W. Methlagl und A. Janik (eds.), Innsbruck: Haymon-Verlag.
  • Hentschel, Klaus, 1990, Interpretationen und Fehlinterpretationen der speziellen und der allgemeinen Relativitätstheorie durch Zeitgenossen Albert Einsteins, Basel-Boston-Berlin: Birkhäuser, 376–390.
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Acknowledgments

As of the 2026 update, Friedrich Stadler has taken responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry. The editors would like to thank Angelina Brooks, the executor of Thomas Oberdan’s estate, for giving us permission to bring on a coauthor to maintain and update this entry.

Copyright © 2026 by
Thomas Oberdan
Friedrich Stadler <friedrich.stadler@univie.ac.at>

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