Ethics of Artificial Intelligence and Robotics

First published Thu Apr 30, 2020; substantive revision Fri Mar 27, 2026

After around 70 years of development, it is now clear that AI and robotics do have substantial impact on the world, even if the exact nature and depth of that impact is unclear. Which impact AI and robotics should have also remains a largely unsolved question, and that is the main question of this article. In addition, AI and robotics have also given us occasion to reflect theoretically on fundamental philosophical and ethical issues. The main debates that seem to have practical impact or theoretical relevance currently are about privacy, human autonomy, automated decisions, human-machine interaction, employment and the impact on society as a whole – plus the more abstract notions of autonomy, agency and superintelligence. For each of these issues, we outline the existing positions and arguments, and how these hang together with other issues. Overall, the ethics of AI and robotics should mainly allow us to understand and evaluate techno-social development, thus enabling decisions which developments to avoid, but also enabling a positive vision for a world with AI and robotics that is worth wanting.

1. Introduction

1.1 Scope: Ethics of AI & Robotics

The design and use of AI and robotics have raised many ethical issues, some specific to these technologies, some more general. These often go back to “concerns” of various sorts – which are a typical response to new technologies. Many such concerns turn out to be rather quaint (such as that trains are too fast for souls), some are predictably wrong when they suggest that the technology fundamentally changes humans (telephones will destroy personal communication, writing will destroy memory), some broadly correct but moderately relevant (digital technology will destroy industries), and some broadly correct and deeply relevant (cars will change towns, smart phones will generate dependence). The task of an article such as this is to explain what philosophical research has done to analyse the issues, to move from vague fears to well-understood problems, and to deflate the non-issues – while remaining cautious in the judgment what the important issues really are.

The ethics of AI and robotics is particularly difficult, since it involves an understanding of normative ethics and metaethics, an understanding of the technologies, plus expertise in the many areas of social impact. There are discussions of AI ethics not only within philosophy and computer science, but also in other academic disciplines, especially in political science, economics, media studies, education, environmental studies and law – and in large spheres of society outside academia. This seems to indicate that we need a better understanding of which issues should be treated in philosophy, and a better division of labour with other disciplines. Within philosophy, the fields that have contributed to the debates about AI and robotics have widened from philosophy of mind and normative ethics to metaethics, philosophy of science, epistemology, philosophy of language, metaethics, and political philosophy. Our topic gives us pause to reflect on the relation between philosophical and non-philosophical approaches to AI ethics, and on fundamental concepts of philosophy itself – the latter activity is sometimes called “AI philosophy” (Müller 2025b; Müller and Löhr forthcoming).

AI somehow gets closer to our skin than other technologies: This has to do with the fact that the project of AI is to create machines that have features which are central to how we humans see ourselves, namely as feeling, thinking, intelligent beings. The classic notion of “artificial intelligent agency” involves a sequence of sense-model-plan-act, but current AI applications also include perception, text analysis, natural language processing (NLP), logical reasoning, game-playing, decision (support) systems, data analytics, predictive analytics, as well as autonomous vehicles, humanoid robots, and other forms of robotics (P. Stone et al. 2021). In the following it will become clear that it is often useful to think of AI as decision-machines, perhaps as implementations of rational choice (cf. S. Russell 2019, 23; S. Russell and Norvig 2020, 57).

Which issues are discussed here and how are they ordered? Since the SEP is a philosophical encyclopedia, this article is ordered by ethical problems, while other surveys focus on policy and compliance (Corrêa et al. 2023), or on safety of certain technologies. One could thus think of the landscape of AI ethics as a matrix of ethical issues vs. technologies. What is considered an “important problem” for AI ethics often has to do with the context people come from: Privacy protection is central for individual autonomy, while racial discrimination or economic injustice are more prominent in certain societies, as is the discrimination of women, perhaps environmental damage and superintelligence seem more central to people in affluent and peaceful societies. We aim for a fairly wide understanding here, based on both a) societal relevance and b) theoretical interest.

There are two perspectives that often run under the heading of “ethics”, but will play a less central role here. One of these is “AI policy”, which specifies societal structures and measures to handle AI, including regulation and standardisation. It appears, however, that the debates on policy are now largely divorced from philosophy and more of a political, legal and technical nature – even though they often rely on ethical judgments, which was even more obvious in the era of “AI Principles” (ca. 2015–20). In this article, policy matters are discussed in a short separate section (2.10), rather than with each ethical issue.

Another prominent perspective is to discuss AI ethics in terms of risks of AI and of technical safety from risk (e.g. Brundage et al. 2018; Bengio et al. 2024; Narayanan and Kapoor 2024; Bengio et al. 2025 [Other Internet Resources]; Hendrycks 2025). These discussions aim to find out which consequences are probable, and how to avoid negative consequences through technical and societal means. While many of these issues are central ethical issues, it seems clear that the discussion of AI ethics should not be framed entirely in terms of “risk”: a) some ethical considerations are not consequentialist; b) there is ethical discussion how to evaluate consequences; c) technical discussions about avoiding risks are not part of ethics; d) some negative consequences are actual, not risks; and e) the discussion on AI ethics should not be framed only in negative terms, but it should generate a positive vision of a future worth wanting. Technical AI safety (sometimes called “alignment”) is a societally highly important task that is closely related to AI ethics, but is not identical to it. Large AI technology firms typically had some form of “ethics” or “safety” committee, but most were dismantled in the 2020s. Problems of risk will feature in the discussions of most ethical issues.

Finally, for a problem to qualify as a “problem for ethics”, we would require that it is unclear what is ethical in the particular case, thus excluding things that are simply “ethically problematic” or “unethical” (e.g. fraud and murder). Having said that, technical systems in a social context (techno-social systems) always make some human decisions and some societal developments more likely than others, e.g. they provide a “nudge”, they have affordances, or they change the epistemic situation. For example, an LLM might make it possible for a person to build a virus, to hack a database, to commit fraud, or to impersonate someone else (OpenAI 2025). It this thus within the scope of this article to consider where AI and robotics enable such behaviour or a particular societal development.

1.2 Techno-social Background

To some extent, the field of “applied ethics” is driven by technology: When a new kind of system comes out, new problems appear. Though prediction has its risks, it seems clear that if the technical progress of AI continues the way it does now (early 2026), we are looking at a major technical, societal and environmental change that is as fundamental as the one generated by the industrial revolution, with its move from human- and horse-power to water/steam/electricity.

In the 20th Century, AI was usually understood as a research programme where the cognitive sciences would develop models of human intelligence as computation over meaningful symbols, and the computer sciences would implement these models on digital hardware, thus both testing the models, and achieving a general form of artificial intelligence. This programme is evident in Searle’s notion of “strong AI”: “computers given the right programs can be literally said to understand and have other cognitive states” (Searle 1980, 417). It was later called “classical AI”, and it was in some competition with “connectionist AI” which proposed to focus on modelling the brain in “neural networks”, rather than in its functional architecture. Both versions of AI ran into significant problems during the “AI winter(s)”, ca. 1975–1995, and they spun off some specialised technical disciplines (e.g. image pattern recognition or robotics) that often avoided the tainted name “AI”.

With the advent of more successful machine learning (ML) systems in the 2010s, mainly with multi-layered (“deep”) neural networks (LeCun, Bengio, and Hinton 2015; Schmidhuber 2015), and especially with popular generative AI, such as large language models (LLMs) around 2020, the use of the term “AI” has broadened massively. The major change towards ML has to do with algorithmic progress (e.g. general adversarial networks, or transformer models) and the fact that the cost of computing power and storage has reduced, while the investment has increased. The resulting exponential gains in computing power and data storage have led to the ability to train models on massive data (essentially all available data), and to generate very large models (typically at a size of 20–50% of the training data). This “scaling” achieves radical improvements of ML systems, that often went from performance at 10% human level to beyond human level in a few years. Current AI trends are tracked in several places; one prominent source is the HAI “AI Index” (https://hai.stanford.edu/ai-index/).

The general aim of classical AI had been all but quietly given up after the AI winters, though a small group pushed for the idea that classical AI should focus directly on “Artificial General Intelligence” (AGI) – organising a niche conference series under that title since 2008. In the last 10 years, it has become common to ask once again, whether we might be on a road to a general AI, now understood to be based mainly on ML. The old label “AGI” is now often used to differentiate the aim of general artificial intelligence at roughly human level from technical AI on specific problems, with the implication that something important happens at that point (this assumption drives some of the current hyper-investment into AI). It remains an open question whether AI is on course towards general intelligence (AAAI 2025, 58–63; Bengio et al. 2025) – this question matters to ethics in many ways, e.g. suggestions that minor AI quibbles do not matter compared to the enormous benefits of AGI, or that the arguments for existential risk from superintelligence become more urgent the closer we move to AGI.

Given that AI runs on computers, some there is a question which role quantum computing could play, where superposition qbits allows computation that can be so much more efficient on resources (e.g. on time), that some functions that were practically impossible to compute, or “intractable”, do become practically possible to compute (e.g. taking seconds rather than centuries) – while the set of quantum computable functions is not larger than that of the Turing-computable functions (Deutsch 1985). This efficiency gain has enormous practical relevance because public key encryption, and thus most of computer security and identification, relies on “trap-door functions” that are practically easy to compute in one direction but very hard to compute in the opposite direction (e.g. “multiply these two prime numbers”, vs. “find out which two prime numbers, if multiplied, would result in this number”). The security problem of quantum computing, if it were achieved on a practical level, is thus not specific to AI, but it would affect AI, too.

While AI is entirely software, robots are physical machines that are subject to physical forces; they have “sensors” and they exert physical force onto the world through “actuators”, like a gripper or a turning wheel. Accordingly, autonomous cars or planes are robots, and only a very small portion of current robots is “humanoid” (human-shaped). Some robots use AI, and some do not: Typical industrial robots still blindly follow completely defined scripts with minimal sensory input and no learning or reasoning, in a maximally controlled environment. However, there is an increasing use of AI in robotics, including humanoids, mainly for sensation and action-control. Robots and AI systems can thus be seen as two overlapping sets: Systems that are only AI, systems that are only robotics, and systems that are both. We are interested in all three; the scope of this article is the union of both sets.

It is worth remembering that the ethics of AI and robotics is a very young discipline: The first publications on robot-ethics or machine ethics appeared in the early 2000s (Moor 2006), the first conference on AI ethics took place in 2012 (Müller 2014), the first books appeared on superintelligence (Bostrom 2014), machine ethics (Misselhorn 2018/22), and the control problem (S. Russell 2019). Then, the first survey articles (Müller 2020) and books appeared (Dignum 2019; Coeckelbergh 2020; Dubber, Pasquale, and Das 2020; Gordon and Nyholm 2021), as well as more policy-oriented work (Floridi et al. 2018; Taddeo and Floridi 2018; Taylor et al. 2018; Walsh 2018; Bryson 2019; Gibert 2019; Whittlestone et al. 2019). We probably still lack a well-established scope, method, or canonical works (L. E. Frank and Klincewicz 2024). Also, there is little history of AI ethics (Casiraghi 2023), and of the wider field of computer ethics or digital ethics (but see Müller 2022). Useful surveys for the ethics of robotics include (Calo, Froomkin, and Kerr 2016; Royakkers and van Est 2016; Tzafestas 2016; Coeckelbergh 2022b); a standard collection of papers is (Lin, Abney, and Jenkins 2017). Handbooks and surveys of AI ethics include (Boddington 2023; Floridi 2023b; Bullock et al. 2024; Gunkel 2024; Floridi and Taddeo 2025; Hähnel and Müller 2025; Smuha 2025), with (Hagendorff 2024) on generative AI and (Nyholm, Kasirzadeh, and Zerilli 2026) on contemporary debates.

The world has changed in the last few years. It is likely that more literature has been published on the topic of this article since the first version (early 2020) than in the entire time before. Also, papers are now published in mainstream philosophical journals who used to ignore AI and computing. The selection of the literature that is referred to here thus must be narrower and will be more prone to errors. The main ordering that was proposed in 2020, in the absence of a prior survey article or book, appears to have held up reasonably well.

A note on tone: It is characteristic of the “ethics of x” that it tends to deal with ethical problems of x, rather than with the merits of x. The result is that the ethics of AI appears “negative about AI”. This is a tendency we try to mitigate here: The point of an ethics of AI is to find out what AI should be like, to analyse the difficulties of finding out what is the right way to act with respect to AI. So, ideally, AI ethics provides direction for “good engineering” (this comes under various names, such as “trustworthy”, “humane”, “aligned”, “reliable” or “ethical”). Thus, the societal task of AI ethics is to provide guidance for good AI design and use, for a world worth wanting (if AI is part of such a world).

2. Main Debates

2.1 Privacy & Data Protection

Privacy has several well recognised aspects, e.g. “the right to be let alone”, control over information about oneself (Rachels 1975), privacy as an aspect of personhood, and – in English – also local and bodily privacy (Bennett and Raab 2018; Roessler 2018). The discussion about privacy and surveillance in information technology (e.g. Macnish 2017; Roessler 2017) mainly concerns personally identifiable data, i.e. the access to, and control over that data, or a combination of both (Véliz 2024). Classic privacy studies focused on state surveillance by secret services but now include surveillance by other state agents, businesses and even individuals. The relevant information technology has changed significantly in the last decades, while regulation has been slow to respond (though there is the (GDPR 2016)) – the result is a certain anarchy that is exploited by the most powerful players and that has produced significant political discussion (Véliz 2020).

2.1.1 The Digital Sphere

The digital sphere has widened greatly in recent decades: All data collection and storage is now digital, our lives are increasingly digital, there is more and more sensor technology in use that generates data about non-digital aspects of our lives, and most digital data is connected to a single Internet. In addition, much of the data is traded between agents, usually for a fee. As a result, controlling who collects which data, and who has access, is much harder in the digital world than it was in the analogue world of paper and telephone calls.

AI increases both the possibilities of intelligent data collection and the possibilities for data analysis – and it increases the value of data, since it can be used for training ML systems. For example, face recognition in photos and videos, “device fingerprinting” and a host of other techniques researched in computer science (e.g. Rocher, Hendrickx, and de Montjoye 2019) allow real time identification and thus profiling and searching for individual humans or their devices (Whittaker et al. 2018, 15ff ). The result is that “In this vast ocean of data, there is a frighteningly complete picture of us” (Smolan 2016, 1:01) … a remark that already seems trivial now.

The data trail we leave behind is how our “free” services are paid for – but we are not told about that data collection and the value of this new raw material, and we are manipulated into leaving ever more such data. For the “big 5” companies (Amazon, Google/Alphabet, Microsoft, Apple, Facebook/Meta), the main data-collection part of their business appears to be based on deception, exploiting human weaknesses, furthering procrastination, generating addiction, and manipulation (Harris 2016; Klenk and Jongepier 2022). The primary focus of social media, gaming, and most of the Internet in this “surveillance economy” is to gain, maintain and direct attention – and thus continued data supply. As Schneier said, “surveillance is the business model of the Internet” (Schneier 2015); this is sometimes captured in the catchword “surveillance capitalism” (Williams 2018; Zuboff 2019; Königs 2024).

2.1.2 Losing Control of Data?

One useful perspective on privacy from the “control” angle is to see it as the demand that information integrity is preserved in the relevant contexts, i.e. “contextual integrity” demands that the flow of information is appropriately controlled (Nissenbaum 2004). The problem of AI generated images and videos of actual people may suit this approach. It has been argued that a loss of “freedom” is the characteristic feature of the AI era (Santoni de Sio 2024). This loss has caused many attempts to escape from the grasp of surveillance capitalism, e.g. in exercises of “minimalism” (Newport 2019), or through the open-source movement – but it is doubtful that present-day citizens have the autonomy needed.

Surveillance systems will often reveal facts about us that we ourselves wish to suppress or are not aware of: they know more about us than we know ourselves. Even just observing online behaviour allows insights into our mental states (Burr and Christianini 2019) and manipulation (see below (2.1.2)). This has led to calls for the protection of “derived data” (Wachter and Mittelstadt 2019). With the last sentence of his bestselling book Homo Deus (Harari 2016) asks about the long-term consequences of AI: “What will happen to society, politics and daily life when non-conscious but highly intelligent algorithms know us better than we know ourselves?” (never mind whether an algorithm can “know”).

Robotic systems are beginning to play a major role in this area, esp. from the air. Together with the “Internet of things”, the “smart” systems (phone, TV, oven, lamp, virtual assistant, home, …), the “smart city” (Sennett 2018), “smart governance”, and “smart agentic AI”, they are set to become part of the data-gathering system that offers more detailed data in real time, with ever more information.

There is an “arms race” between surveillance and individual freedom and there is an important societal question where a good balance lies. Both “sides” use information technology, e.g. privacy can be protected by encryption, anonymity, cryptocurrency. For some research purposes, there are privacy-preserving techniques that can largely conceal the identity of persons or groups, e.g. “differential privacy” by adding calibrated noise to encrypt the output of queries (Dwork et al. 2006; Garfinkel 2025). While some companies sell surveillance, others sell protection from surveillance, e.g. in operation systems for computers and phones.

One of the major practical difficulties is to actually enforce regulation, both on the level of the state and on the level of the individual who has a claim. They must identify the responsible legal entity, prove the action, perhaps prove intent, find a court that declares itself competent … and eventually get the court to actually enforce its decision. Well-established legal protection of rights such as consumer rights, product liability and other civil liability or protection of intellectual property rights is often missing in digital products, or hard to enforce. This means that companies with a “digital” background are used to testing their products on the consumers, without fear of liability, while defending their intellectual property rights. This “Internet Libertarianism” is sometimes taken to assume that technical solutions will take care of societal problems by themselves (Mozorov 2013).

2.2 Human Autonomy & Manipulation

The ethical issues of AI in surveillance go beyond the mere accumulation of data, control of data flow and direction of attention: They include the use of information to manipulate behaviour, online and offline. Assuming choice has the standard “control condition” and “epistemic condition”, manipulation can use both. Human action selection is often quite far from cool rational choice, so our tendencies to procrastination and other sub-optimal behaviour, which can be exploited for manipulation. While efforts to manipulate behaviour are as old as humanity (Noggle 2022), they gain a new quality with AI systems (Prunkl 2024; Schneider 2025). Jaron Lanier already wrote in 2014: “When you are wearing sensors on your body all the time, such as the GPS and camera on your smartphone and constantly piping data to a megacomputer owned by a corporation that is paid by ”advertisers“ to subtly manipulate you ... you gradually become less free.” (Lanier 2014).

With sufficient prior data, algorithms can be used to target individuals or small groups with just the kind of personalised input that is likely to influence these particular individuals. Given users’ intense interaction with data systems and the deep knowledge about individuals this provides, they are vulnerable to positive “nudges” (Thaler and Sunstein 2008), emotional manipulation, as well as negative manipulation and deception. Profit-oriented businesses exploit behavioural biases, deception, and the generation of addiction (Costa and Halpern 2019) – e.g. through “dark patterns” on web pages or in games (Mathur et al. 2019; Luguri and Strahilevitz 2021; Klenk 2022). While offline gambling and the sale of addictive substances are highly regulated, online manipulation and addiction is not. Control is increased by system lock-in and software monopolies. One detail of this loss of control is the absence of “informed consent” (Faden and Beauchamp 1986) when agreeing to “terms and conditions” of software and IT services. The culmination of this problem is reached when decisions are handed over to an AI agent, and the human does not need to be manipulated any more.

Improved AI “faking” technologies make what once was reliable evidence into unreliable evidence – this has already happened to digital photos, sound recordings and video … and it is now quite easy to create (rather than alter) “deep fake” text, photos and video material with any content desired. Sophisticated real-time interaction with persons over texting, phone or video can be faked, too. So, we cannot trust digital interaction, while we are at the same time increasingly dependent on such interaction. It has been argued that technological manipulation poses significant threats to our opportunities to live meaningful lives (Nyholm 2022) and that the basis of our epistemic practices (see the next section) for establishing belief and knowledge is threatened by this development (Rini 2020; Robert Sparrow and Flenady 2025).

2.3 Epistemic Issues: Opacity & Explainability

When an AI system makes a decision, e.g. “you are denied a credit card”, it will often be impossible for the affected person to know how the system came to this output, i.e. the system is “opaque” or “black box” to that person. Furthermore, many AI systems rely on machine learning techniques in (simulated) neural networks that will extract patterns from a given dataset, with or without “correct” solutions provided; i.e. supervised, semi-supervised or unsupervised. With these techniques, the “learning” captures patterns in the data and these are labelled in a way that appears useful to the decision the system makes, while the programmer does not really know which patterns in the data the system has used. What this means is that the outcome is opaque to the expert programmers, too – this is standard opacity (Durán and Jongsma 2021). Sometimes, there is perhaps even “deep” or “essential” opacity that cannot be removed, in principle (Humphreys 2009; Müller 2025a; Beisbart 2026).

It is well known that epistemic conditions have an impact on normative issues. In our case, if there is opacity, then any bias in decision-making will be hard to detect. Opacity and bias are central issues in what is now sometimes called “data ethics”, “big data ethics” or “ethics of algorithms” (Floridi and Taddeo 2016; Mittelstadt et al. 2016). AI systems for automated decision support and “predictive analytics” raise “significant concerns about lack of due process, accountability, community engagement, and auditing” (Danaher 2016b; Whittaker et al. 2018, 18ff). It is not clear that the idea of a right to a human decision or justification, as in the GDPR, is really what is needed; some authors have argued that instead we have a right to right to a “well-calibrated machine decision” (Huq 2020) or that we need to avoid a “testimony gap” (Robert Sparrow and Flenady 2025). Sometimes opacity and manipulation are discussed under the headings of “epistemic technology” (Alvarado 2023) or “epistemic risk”, but it remains to be seen whether notions and questions from traditional epistemology (about the conditions for true justified belief) are suitable for the many ways in which human perception and knowledge are impacted by AI technologies.

The opacity has generated attempts to outline the constraints for explainable AI (XAI) (Zednik 2021) and the role of cognitive models (Budding and Zednik 2024). What exactly “interpretable” means is under discussion, especially its relation to explanation (Sullivan 2022; Zerilli 2022) and trust (Baron 2025; Robertson 2025) – the typical distinction is between the causes that lead to a decision and the reasons that a rational agent would provide, where the latter is what counts for responsibility. There are many activities that aim to remove or remedy opacity through “explainable AI” (XAI), which is now a significant technical field (Schwalbe and Finzel 2024).

2.4 Good Decisions: Fairness & Bias

2.4.1 Decisions

As mentioned above, it can be useful to regard all AI systems as decision systems. What constitutes a “good” decision is hotly debated in the theory of rational choice (Thoma 2019). It has also been argued that some hard choices are “on a par” (Chang 2002), but it does matter which one is chosen, because we make it “ours” for the future (Chang 2020). It is worth considering whether AI decisions or recommendations should be based on the assumption of user “preferences”. This is a common terminology in IT, but it is not clear that the science that specialises on the prediction of human behaviour (psychology) makes much use of it.

Automated AI decision support systems and “predictive analytics” operate on data and produce a decision as “output”. This output may range from the relatively trivial to the highly significant: “this restaurant matches your preferences”, “bail is denied”, or “target identified and engaged”. Data analysis is often used in “predictive analytics” in business, healthcare and other fields, to foresee future developments – since prediction is easier, it will also become a cheaper commodity. One use of prediction is in “predictive policing” (Meijer and Wessels 2019), which involves a threat to public liberties (Alikhademi et al. 2022) because it can take away power from the people who are predicted. It appears, however, that many of the worries about policing depend on futuristic scenarios where law enforcement foresees and punishes planned actions, rather than waiting until a crime has been committed (like in the 2002 film “Minority Report”). In principle, there could be merits in the approach for all stakeholders (Asaro 2019).

With the advent of LLMs, it became more conceivable to have AI systems themselves advising on ethical matters. Perhaps AI systems could even allow us to become better humans, by our own standards (O’Neill, Klincewicz, and Kemmer 2022). It appears that even early versions were doing well enough such that “no significant difference in the perceived value of the advice between human generated ethical advice and AI-generated ethical advice” was seen (Terwiesch, Meincke, and Nave 2023).

2.4.2 Bias

AI systems can be used in the support or replacement of human decisions, and in these cases the decisions can have a “bias”, i.e. it can make a decision on the basis of criteria that are irrelevant, and perhaps thus discriminate negatively against some individual or group (cf. also Friedman 1996). Bias typically surfaces when unfair judgments are made because the individual making the judgment is influenced by a characteristic that is actually irrelevant to the matter at hand, typically a discriminatory preconception about members of a group. The person having a bias may not be aware of having that bias – they may even be honestly and explicitly opposed to a bias they are found to have (e.g. through priming, cf. (Graham and Lowery 2004)). On fairness vs. bias in machine learning, see (Binns 2018), on the more general notion of bias (Johnson 2024).

Apart from the social phenomenon of learned bias, the human cognitive system is generally prone to have various kinds of “cognitive biases”, e.g. the “confirmation bias”: humans tend to interpret information as confirming what they already believe. Though these forms of bias is often said to impede performance in rational judgment (Kahnemann 2011), they are really just a way for cognitive systems to deal with the fact that resources available for a given decision (time, data) are always limited. This is known as “bounded optimality” in computer science (S. Russell 2016) or “resource-rational analysis” in psychology (Lieder and Griffiths 2020).

A third form of bias is in present in data, when it exhibits systematic error, e.g. one of the various kinds of “statistical bias”. Strictly, any given dataset will only be unbiased for a single kind of issue, so the mere creation of a dataset involves the danger that may it be used for a different kind of issue, and then turn out to be biased for that kind. Machine learning on the basis of such data would then not only fail to recognise the bias, but codify and automate the “historical bias”. The problem with such systems is thus bias plus humans placing excessive trust in the systems. The political repercussions of such automated systems can be significant (Eubanks 2018). Furthermore, the quality of the program depends heavily on the quality of the data provided, following the old slogan “garbage in, garbage out”. So, if the data already involved a bias (e.g. police data about the skin colour of suspects), then the program will reproduce that bias. Some have argued that the ethical problems of today are the result of technical “shortcuts” AI has taken (Marcus 2018 [Other Internet Resources]; Cristianini 2023) – which links the problem of bias to the general philosophy of technology (see below).

It appears that technological fixes for the problem of bias have inherent limits in that they need a mathematical notion of fairness, which is hard to come by (Whittaker et al. 2018, 24ff; Selbst et al. 2019); as is a formal notion of key terms, like “race” (see Benthall and Haynes 2019) or “woman” (Mason 2022).

2.5 Human-Robot Interaction

Human-robot interaction (HRI) is an academic fields in its own right, which now pays significant attention to ethical matters, the dynamics of perception from both sides, and both the different interests present in and the intricacy of the social context, including co-working (e.g. Arnold and Scheutz 2017).

AI it can also be used to drive robots that are problematic if their processes or appearance involve deception, threaten human dignity, or violate the Kantian requirement of “respect for humanity”. It appears that humans very easily attribute mental properties to objects, and empathise with them, especially when the outer appearance of these objects is similar to that of living beings. This can be used to deceive humans (or animals) into attributing more intellectual or even emotional significance to robots or AI systems than they deserve. Some parts of humanoid and animal robotics are problematic in this regard.

Basic constraints of business ethics and law apply to robots, too: product safety and liability, or non-deception in advertisement. It appears that these existing constraints take care of many concerns that are raised. There are cases, however, where human-human interaction has aspects that appear specifically human in ways that can perhaps not be replaced by robots: care, love and sex.

These issues will be more urgent soon, when robots actually leave the industrial “yellow cages”, with the help of AI, and appear in more everyday life circumstances.

2.5.1 Example (a) Care Robots

The use of robots in health care for humans is currently at the level of concept studies in real environments, but it may become a usable technology in a few years, and has raised a number of concerns for a dystopian future of de-humanised care (A. Sharkey and Sharkey 2011; Rob Sparrow 2016). Current systems include robots that support human carers/caregivers (e.g. in lifting patients, or transporting material), robots that enable patients to do certain things by themselves (e.g. eat with a robotic arm), but also robots that are given to patients as company and comfort (e.g. the “Paro” robot seal). For an overview, see (van Wynsberghe 2016; Nørskov 2017; Fosch-Villaronga and Albo-Canals 2019), for a survey of users (Draper et al. 2014).

One reason why the issue of care has come to the fore is that people have argued that we will need robots in ageing societies. It is not very clear that there really is an issue here, since the discussion mostly focuses on the fear of robots de-humanising care, but the actual and foreseeable robots in care are for classic automation of technical tasks as assistive robots. They are thus “care robots” only in a behavioural sense of performing tasks in care environments, not in the sense that a human “cares” for the patients. If anything, the risk of robots in care is the absence of such intentional care – because less human carers may be needed. Interestingly, caring for something, even a virtual agent, can be good for the carer themselves (Lee et al. 2019). A system that pretends to care would be deceptive and thus problematic – unless the deception is countered by sufficiently large utility gain (Coeckelbergh 2016). Perhaps feeling cared for by a machine, to some extent, can be progress in some cases?

2.5.2 Example (b) Sex Robots

It has been argued by several tech optimists that humans will likely be interested in sex and companionship with robots and be comfortable with the idea (Levy 2007). Given the variation of human sexual preferences, including sex toys and sex dolls, this seems very likely: The question is whether such devices should be manufactured and promoted, and whether there should be limits to use in this murky area. It seems to have moved into the mainstream of “robot philosophy” in recent times (Sullins 2012; Danaher and McArthur 2017; N. Sharkey et al. 2017; Bendel 2018; Devlin 2018).

Humans have long had deep emotional attachments to objects, so perhaps companionship or even love with a predictable android is attractive, especially to people who struggle with actual humans, and already prefer dogs, cats, a bird, a computer or a tamagotchi. Some authors (Nyholm, Danaher, and Earp 2022) argue that this can be true friendship, and is thus is a valuable goal. It certainly looks like such friendship might increase overall utility, even if lacking in depth and function (Miyahara and Shimizu 2025). In all this area there is an issue of deception, since a robot cannot (at present) mean what it says, or have feelings for a human. It is well known that humans are prone to attribute feelings and thoughts to entities that behave as if they had sentience, and even to clearly inanimate objects that show no behaviour at all. Also, paying for deception seems to be an elementary part of the traditional sex industry.

Finally, there are concerns that have often accompanied matters of sex, namely consent (L. Frank and Nyholm 2017), aesthetic concerns, and the worry that humans may be “corrupted” by certain experiences. Old fashioned though this may seem, human behaviour is influenced by experience, and it is likely that pornography or sex robots support the perception of other humans as mere objects of desire, or even as recipients of abuse, and thus ruin a deeper sexual and erotic experience. The “Campaign Against Sex Robots” argues that these devices are a continuation of slavery and prostitution (Richardson 2016).

2.6 Autonomous AI Systems

2.6.1 Autonomy Generally

There are several notions of autonomy in the discussion of autonomous systems. A stronger notion is involved in philosophical debates where autonomy is the basis for responsibility and personhood (Christman 2018). In this context, responsibility implies autonomy, but not inversely, so there can be systems that have degrees of technical autonomy without raising issues of responsibility. The weaker, more technical, notion of autonomy in robotics is relative and gradual: A system is said to be autonomous with respect to human control to a certain degree (Müller 2012). There is a parallel here to the issues of bias and opacity in AI since autonomy also concerns a power-relation: who is in control, and who is responsible? Higher autonomy implies higher risk, but higher autonomy is also a requirement for higher productivity gains, so the development is towards higher risk. So, the issue is mainly one of risk and misuse, less of serious autonomy.

In most jurisdictions, there is a sophisticated system of civil and criminal law to resolve issues of liability. Technical standards, e.g. for the safe use of machinery in medical environments, will likely need to be adjusted. There is already a field of “verifiable AI” for such safety-critical systems, and for “security applications”. Technical standards are an important part of such regulation and self-regulation.

Among the many autonomous systems on land, on water, under water, in the air or in space, we discuss two samples: autonomous vehicles and autonomous weapons. There is now a development towards AI personal assistants, robotical or not. It seems plausible that these assistants will face significant hurdles, since the ethical and legal responsibility for the actions of the assistant would have to be clarified (Milano and Nyholm 2024).

2.6.2 Example (a) Autonomous Vehicles

Autonomous vehicles hold the promise to reduce the very significant damage that human driving currently causes – with approximately 1 million humans being killed per year, many more injured, the environment polluted, earth sealed with concrete and tarmac, cities full of unused (parked) cars, etc. However, there seem to be questions on how autonomous vehicles should behave, and how responsibility and risk should be distributed in the complicated system the vehicles operates in. (There is also significant disagreement over how long the development of fully autonomous, or “level 5” cars (SAE 2015) will actually take, or whether it has happened already.)

There is significant discussion of “trolley problems” in this context. In the classic “trolley problems” (Thompson 1976), SEP (Woollard and Howard-Snyder 2021) various dilemmas are presented. The simplest version is that of a trolley train on a track that is heading towards five people and will kill them, unless the train is diverted onto a side track, but on that track there is one person, who will be killed if the train takes that side track. The example goes back to a remark in (Foot 1967, 6), who discusses a number of dilemma cases where tolerated differ from intended consequences of an action. “Trolley problems” are not supposed to describe actual ethical problems or to be solved with a “right” choice. Rather, they are thought-experiments where choice is artificially constrained to a small finite number of distinct one-off options and where the agent has perfect knowledge. These problems are used as a theoretical tool to investigate ethical intuitions and theories (Kamm and Rakowski 2016). This type of problem has reminded many of the problems encountered in actual driving, and in autonomous driving (Lin 2015). It is doubtful, however, that an actual driver or autonomous car will ever have to solve trolley problems and it is debated whether this issues has relevance to the ethics of autonomous vehicles (Awad et al. 2018; Paulo 2023).

2.6.3 Example (b) Autonomous Weapons

The notion of automated weapons is fairly old: “For example, instead of fielding simple guided missiles or remotely piloted vehicles, we might launch completely autonomous land, sea, and air vehicles capable of complex, far-ranging reconnaissance and attack missions.” (DARPA 1983, 1). This proposal was ridiculed as “fantasy” at the time (Dreyfus, Dreyfus, and Athanasiou 1986, ix), but it is now a reality, at least for more easily identifiable targets (missiles, vehicles, planes, ships, buildings, etc.). The main arguments against (lethal) autonomous weapon systems (AWS or LAWS), are that they support extrajudicial killings, take responsibility away from humans, and make wars or killings more likely – for a detailed list of issues see (Lin, Bekey, and Abney 2008, 73–86; Taddeo 2024).

Would autonomous weapon systems make wars more likely? It appears that increasing the availability of autonomous weapons systems and reducing the probability of being held accountable would increase the probability of their use. However, the crucial asymmetry of impunity already exists in conventional wars with distance weapons (e.g. remote controlled). These are the kinds of cases brought forward by the Campaign to Stop Killer Robots and other activist groups. Some seem to be equivalent to saying that autonomous weapons are indeed weapons …, and weapons kill, but we still make them in gigantic numbers. On the matter of accountability, autonomous weapons might make identification and prosecution of the responsible agents more difficult – but this is not clear, given the digital records that one can keep, at least in a conventional war. The difficulty of allocating punishment is sometimes called the “retribution gap” (Danaher 2016a). The development in the last 5 years seems towards the acceptance of AI in warfare, but many ethical issues remain, and – officially at least – there are still always “humans in the loop”, even though the use of AI, e.g. for target identification, reduces human input, especially when speed is crucial. In regulatory terms, a total ban now seems off the cards.

Another question seems to be whether using autonomous weapons in war would make wars worse, or perhaps make wars less bad? If robots reduce casualties, war crimes and crimes in war, the answer may well be positive and has been used as an argument in favour of these weapons (Arkin 2009; Müller 2016a) but also as an argument against (Amoroso and Tamburrini 2018). Arguably the main threat is not the use of such weapons in conventional warfare, but in asymmetric conflicts or by non-state agents, including criminals.

It has also been said that autonomous weapons cannot conform to International Humanitarian Law, which requires observance of the principles of distinction (between combatants and civilians), proportionality (of force) and military necessity (of force) in military conflict (A. Sharkey 2019). This now seems more of a technical issue, such that weapons must be constructed and used such that they do violate Humanitarian Law. There are strong indications that human rights are a useful framework for AI ethics, but this has not been much used, with some exceptions (Smuha 2021a) – inversely, it is widely recognised in human rights research that AI has significant impact on the field. Sometimes the concept of human dignity has been raised in this context (A. Sharkey 2019; cf. Rueda et al. 2025).

2.7 Moral Status, Machine Ethics, Responsibility

2.7.1 Moral Status

In a first approximation, the issue of moral status of AI and robotics systems concerns the question whether they have obligations, and whether we have obligations to them – this is often put in terms of agency: an entity is a moral agent if and only if it has obligations, and it is a moral patient, if and only if moral agents (e.g. humans) have obligations towards it. Humans are the typical examples of moral agents, and sentient animals the typical example of patients. The standard view is that AI and robotics systems have no moral status of any kind … but this view has come under pressure, and the discussion has led to insights about the nature of moral status (Misselhorn 2020; Powers and Ganascia 2020).

Some authors have indicated that it should be seriously considered whether current robots must be allocated rights (Gunkel 2018; Turner 2019; Danaher 2020). This position seems to rely largely on criticism of the opponents and on the empirical observation that robots and other non-persons are sometimes treated as having rights. In this vein, a “relational turn” has been proposed: If we relate to robots as though they had rights, then it might be futile to search whether they really do have such rights (Coeckelbergh 2010, 2012, 2018). This raises the question how far such anti-realism can go, and what it means then to say that “robots have rights” in a human-centred approach (Gerdes 2016). On the other side of the debate, Bryson has insisted that robots should not enjoy rights (Bryson 2010), though she considers it a possibility (Gunkel and Bryson 2014). It seems that the discussion of “rights” is now moving to either the area of superintelligence (Gordon 2022) or a discussion of “moral status”, see (Clarke and Savulescu 2021; Clarke, Zohny, and Savulescu 2021; Müller 2021), where there is a trend in favour of the view that sentience is at least a necessary condition for moral status (Königs 2025). Accordingly, there is a concern whether it would be ethical to create AI systems with consciousness (Butlin et al. 2023 [Other Internet Resources]; Dung 2023), since this might enable sentience, and thus suffering. Some authors have called for a “moratorium on synthetic phenomenology” (Bentley et al. 2018, 28f; Metzinger 2021).

There is a wholly separate issue whether robots (or other AI systems) should be given the status of “legal entities”, or “legal persons” – in a sense in which natural persons, but also states, businesses or organisations are “legal entities”, namely they can have financial rights and liability, but not criminal liability (cf. Bryson, Diamantis, and Grant 2017; Bertolini and Aiello 2018). In environmental ethics there is a long-standing discussion about legal rights for natural objects (C. D. Stone 1972).

2.7.2 Agency

The classical “thick” notion of a moral agent is designed to assign moral responsibility, the ability to take blame and praise. It thus implies an epistemic condition (knowledge about the world), a control condition (ability to act in the world), a normative condition (ability to act on reasons, especially reflected preferences), and the possibility to be influenced by suffering or joy, technically phenomenal states with valence, or sentience (Müller 2021; Dung 2025). Some authors looking at the issue from a technical side have concluded that LLMs lack essential features of moral agency: There is no individual agent, the agent does not generate its own norms, and the agent is not shaped by its interaction (Barandiaran and Almendros 2024 [Other Internet Resources]). It is tempting to say that current AI has no “real values” at all, just preferences according to which it may act. It lacks the responsibility for them, since it cannot reflect on values or change them. Moral agency is closely related to personhood, which is associated with free will (Frankfurt 1971; Strawson 2004).

However, there is a “thin” notion of agency that is taken from the technical notion of agency, “a thing that does something”, and used in early AI ethics, where a thin notion of “machine ethics” is also used (see below). E.g. “Machine ethics extends the field of computer ethics beyond concern for what people do with their computers to questions about what the machines themselves do.” (Allen, Smit, and Wallach 2006, 15).

James Moor (Moor 2006, 19–20) distinguishes four types of machine agents: ethical impact agents (example: robot jockeys), implicit ethical agents (example: safe autopilot), explicit ethical agents (example: using formal methods to estimate utility), and full ethical agents (“can make explicit ethical judgments and generally is competent to reasonably justify them. An average adult human is a full ethical agent”).

Programmed agents are sometimes not considered “full” agents because they are “competent without comprehension”, just like the neurons in a brain (Dennett 2017; Hakli and Mäkelä 2019). A notable critic of strong claims for the abilities of AI systems, Luciano Floridi, has also suggested that we should use a minimal notion of agency, but a demanding notion of intelligence – so, current AI systems, even a merely reactive LLM, come out as agents, but without intelligence (Floridi 2023a; 2023b, ch. 2) – for a criticism of this approach, see (Zafar 2024).

2.7.3 Machine Ethics

Machine ethics is ethics for machines, for “ethical machines”, for machines as subjects, rather than for the human use of machines as objects. In earlier literature it was often not very clear whether this is supposed to cover all of AI ethics or to be a part of it (Floridi and Saunders 2004; Moor 2006; Anderson and Anderson 2011; Wallach and Asaro 2017), but thankfully the identification of AI ethics with machine ethics has been overcome by now. Sometimes there was the risky inference at play that if machines are ethically relevant, then we need a machine ethics (Anderson and Anderson 2007, 15). This might be true, if “machine ethics” is taken in the thin sense of Moor’s machine agents, where mere “ethical impact” is enough for being an “ethical agent” (Moor 2006, 19) or an “artificial moral agent” (Allen, Varner, and Zinser 2000). This thin sense of machine ethics is identical to “ethics of design”, which is now the more common term (Brey and Dainow 2024) (Friedman 1996; Houkes and Vermaas 2010; Verbeek 2011). If machine ethics is meant in a more demanding sense, then we are back at the discussions about moral agents and patients above. The conflation of both senses of “ethical machine” is now less common than it once was, though there is now occasional use of “alignment” for design (e.g. van de Poel 2020, 388) and thin machine ethics (Cave et al. 2019) as well.

2.7.4 Responsibility

Allocation of responsibility is often a complicated matter: A car maker is responsible for the technical safety of the car, a driver is responsible for driving, a mechanic is responsible for maintenance, the public authorities are responsible for the technical conditions of the roads, etc. In general, “The effects of decisions or actions based on AI are often the result of countless interactions among many actors, including designers, developers, users, software, and hardware. … With distributed agency comes distributed responsibility.” (Taddeo and Floridi 2018, 751). How this distribution might occur is not a problem that is specific to AI, but it gains particular urgency in this context (Nyholm 2018a, 2018b). In classical control engineering, distributed control is often achieved through a control hierarchy plus control loops across these hierarchies. Even individual work is now co-working and co-creation with AI. At the same time, many societal systems depend on allocating responsibility to a person, e.g. for blame and praise, or for liability and copyright.

There have been discussions about the difficulties of allocating responsibility for the killings of an autonomous weapon, and a “responsibility gap” has been suggested (esp. Rob Sparrow 2007), meaning that neither the human nor the machine may be responsible. Perhaps the solution is to keep humans “in the loop” or “on the loop” or in “meaningful control” (Santoni de Sio and van den Hoven 2018), which would allow us to credit where credit is due (Danaher and Nyholm 2021). However, perhaps there truly are tragic choices (Danaher 2022), or we should not assume that for every event there is someone responsible for that event, so the real issue may well be the distribution of risk (Simpson and Müller 2016). Classic risk analysis (Hansson 2013) indicates it is crucial to identify who is exposed to risk, who is a potential beneficiary, and who takes the decisions (Hansson 2018, 1822–1824). For more sceptical accounts of responsibility gaps, see (Tigard 2021; Königs 2022; Da Silva 2024). It remains an open question whether the advent AI systems truly challenge our allocations of responsibility, or rather just generates temporary confusion.

2.8 Superintelligence & Existential Risk

2.8.1 Singularity & Superintelligence

The discussion so far was limited to current and clearly foreseeable forms of AI and their societal consequences. In addition to this “short-term” AI ethics, there is also “long-term” AI ethics, namely the discussion whether in a longer term a new set of problems might develop – perhaps including problems that are serious enough to deserve our attention now (Sætra and Danaher 2025).

The classic narrative for long-term risk from AI has two steps: 1) The current trajectory of artificial intelligence will reach up to systems that surpass the human level of intelligence, that is they are “superintelligent”, and at this point, there is a sharp discontinuity, a “singularity”, from where onwards the development of AI is out of human control and hard to predict (Kurzweil 2005, 487). 2) Once that point is reached, massive negative consequences, including existential risk for the human species (XRisk), have significant probability.

Optimists like Kurzweil or Dario Amodei (the current CEO of Anthropic) make the first step, and then expect a positive development, whereas pessimists like Bostrom or Yudkowsky expect that the risk in the 2nd step follows from the first. Having said that, more recently, some of the discussion about long-term risk is moving away from XRisk and superintelligence, returning to general considerations of risk from AI.

Historically, the fear that “the robots we created will take over the world” had captured human imagination even before there were computers (e.g. Butler 1863) and it is the central theme in Čapek’s famous play that introduced the word “robot” (Čapek 1920): The robots rise up against humans after they have been provided with feelings. This fear was first formulated as a possible trajectory of existing AI into an “intelligence explosion” by Irvin Good:

Let an ultraintelligent machine be defined as a machine that can far surpass all the intellectual activities of any man however clever. Since the design of machines is one of these intellectual activities, an ultraintelligent machine could design even better machines; there would then unquestionably be an “intelligence explosion”, and the intelligence of man would be left far behind. Thus the first ultraintelligent machine is the last invention that man need ever make, provided that the machine is docile enough to tell us how to keep it under control. (Good 1965, 33).

The argument from acceleration to singularity was spelled out by Ray Kurzweil. He pointed out that computing power has been increasing exponentially, i.e. doubling ca. every 2 years since 1970 in accordance with “Moore’s Law” on the number of transistors, and that it will continue to do so for some time in the future. He then predicted in (Kurzweil 1999; cf. Kurzweil 2005) that by 2010 supercomputers will reach human computation capacity, by 2030 “mind uploading” will be possible, and by 2045 the “singularity” will occur.

Despite obvious weaknesses in the identification of “intelligence” with processing power, Kurzweil seems right that humans tend to underestimate the power of exponential growth. Mini-test: If you walked in steps in such a way that each step is double the previous, starting with a step of one metre, how far would you get with 30 steps? (Answer: to Earth’s only permanent natural satellite.) Indeed, most progress in AI is readily attributable to the availability of degrees of magnitude faster processors, larger storage, and higher investment (Müller 2018). Since ca. 2010, the actual development of computing power is accelerating faster than predicted by Kurzweil, due to the massive reduction in price for computation, plus the massive increase in investment and a relative success in “scaling laws” – this has led to many benchmarks being passed, and it has changed estimates of when human-level professional ability might be reached, e.g. (Grace et al. 2024 [Other Internet Resources]) vs. (Müller and Bostrom 2016).

The version of this argument that is now used more commonly (Chalmers 2010), talks about an increase in “intelligence” of the AI system to a level of “superintelligence”. (Bostrom 2014) explains in some detail what would happen at that point, and what the risks for humanity are. The discussion is summarised in (Eden et al. 2012; Armstrong 2014; Shanahan 2015). There are possible paths to superintelligence other than computing power increase, e.g. the complete emulation of the human brain on a computer or in a robot (Kurzweil 2012; Sandberg 2013), biological paths, or networks and organisations (Bostrom 2014, 22–51).

2.8.2 Existential Risk

Once a stage of artificial superintelligence were reached, it seems that they may well have preferences that conflict with the existence of humans on Earth, and may thus decide to end that existence – and given their superior intelligence, they will have the power to do so (or they may happen to end it because they do not really care): This is the risk of extinction of the human species (XRisk) or at least some other “catastrophic risk”. The details of this 2nd step are disputed, but they seem to involve orthogonality and the view that technical development is close to AGI.

One question is what kinds of goals and values the superintelligent system might have. Classic arguments for XRisk suggest that even a programme with relatively benign goals, like “maximise paperclips on earth” (Bostrom 2003b), or “optimise chess performance” (Omohundro 2014) would turn towards XRisk because they would realise that their goals are best reached if certain sub-goals, e.g. to acquire resources, are also reached. This notion is called “instrumental convergence” (Bales, D’Alessandro, and Kirk-Giannini 2024, 4; Gallow 2024).

This only works on the assumption that superintelligence does not imply benevolence – contrary to Kantian traditions in ethics that have argued higher levels of rationality or intelligence would go along with a better understanding of what is moral, and better ability to act morally (Gewirth 1978; Chalmers 2010, 36f). Bostrom expresses this thought as follows:

“The Orthogonality Thesis: Intelligence and final goals are orthogonal axes along which possible agents can freely vary. In other words, more or less any level of intelligence could in principle be combined with more or less any final goal.” (Bostrom 2012, 73; cf. Bostrom 2014, 105–109)

Some authors (Müller and Cannon 2022) have argued that orthogonality plus instrumental convergence incoherently imply two notions of intelligence with and without moral cognition (cf. Greene 2015), while others have supported orthogonality (Dung 2024).

Thinking in the long term is the crucial feature of this literature. Whether the singularity (or another catastrophic event) occurs in 3 years, or in 30 or 3000, does not really matter (Baum et al. 2019). These issues are sometimes taken more broadly as concerning any “catastropic risk” for the species (Rees 2018) – of which AI is only one (Häggström 2016; Ord 2020). The evaluation of XRisk and other catastrophic risk from AI also depends on the details of how superintelligence comes about, abruptly or incrementally (Kasirzadeh 2025). While the XRisk literature is focussed on speculative destruction scenarios, Cappelen et al. (Cappelen, Goldstein, and Hawthorne forthcoming) argue those who dismiss these prospects are advancing equally speculative “survival stories”.

Several collections of papers have investigated the risks of artificial general intelligence (AGI) and the factors that might make this development more or less risk-laden (Müller 2016b; Callaghan et al. 2017; Yampolskiy 2018). The battle lines on the XRisk side now seem hardened (Bostrom and Yudkovski 2014; Yampolskiy 2022; Yudkovski and Soares 2025), while on the side of general considerations of risk (Bengio et al. 2024; Gyevnár and Kasirzadeh 2025)or “instrumental convergence”, there is more movement.

Once argumentative steps towards XRisk from AI are made, the question arises how such consequences could be avoided, if possible. This is usually called the “control problem”: How can humans control a superintelligent AI system (Bostrom 2014, 127ff)? Since actual control of a deployed superintelligent system by mere humans seems very difficult (even for an oracle-type system), the discussion is mostly about how to make sure the values of the system are “aligned” to human values at design stage (in the spirit of machine ethics), so if these remain stable, the system does not need to be controlled further. This raises many technical questions, but also more philosophical ones, like what values are (Zhi-Xuan et al. 2024), what alignment is, which values to select (Gabriel 2020), and how to recognise human values (S. Russell 2019). The discussion about mis-alignment is related to the discussion about misuse of AI, and it has been argued that both can generate XRisk (Hellrigel-Holderbaum and Dung forthcoming)

The discussion of XRisk is often wedded to a version “fanaticism”, i.e. the view that a very large utility in the long run, even with low probability, will overrule medium-size but securely foreseeable utility. This has led to some recent discussion about the acceptability of fanaticism (Wilkinson 2022; J. S. Russell 2024; Bottomley and Williamson 2025). It appears that there is cost both in erring on the too-risky and in erring on the too-cautious side (Müller 2026).

Many participants in this debate share a cultural sphere where technology will develop rapidly and bring broadly radical changes, including “transhuman” views of survival for humankind in a different physical form, e.g. uploaded on a computer (Moravec 1998; Bostrom 2003a; More and Vita-More 2013). They also consider the prospects of “human enhancement”, in various respects, including intelligence (Erler and Müller 2024). Some discussions about superintelligence have religious undertones, e.g. speculation about omniscient beings, the radical changes on a “latter day”, and the promise of immortality through transcendence of our current bodily form (Capurro 1993; Geraci 2008, 2010; O’Connell 2017, 160ff; Gertz 2018).

However, the discussion has moved to the mainstream, and “avoiding XRisk from AGI” has become a common theme in major AI companies, given that AI is advancing massively (Aguirre 2025), while some earlier contributions have tried to stop the discussion about the “myth” of singularity (Floridi 2016; Ganascia 2017). The narrative of XRisk has raised public awareness of philosophy and generated much discussion in the field itself, e.g. on whether a singularity is a trajectory of current AI (Floridi 2023a; Müller 2025b; Thorstad 2025), whether it is even possible, conceptually or practically, and what the role sof its assumptions and central terms are, such as utility, goals, agency, moral rules (D’Alessandro 2025), and risk.

Even philosophers who think that the argumentative situation is not to be analysed in terms of singularity and XRisk, or who think that there are compelling reasons to reject the arguments for XRisk, should acknowledge that they might be wrong. So, the discussion can be justified and fruitful, even if one thinks the probability of XRisk from AI is very low.

2.9 Society, Politics, Economics

2.9.1 Philosophy of Technology

There is a classical tradition of “philosophy of technology”, mostly in Europe, and often referring to M. Heidegger, G. Anders or even K. Marx, which deals with the general relevance of technology for the human condition (Grunwald and Hillerbrand 2021; Gutmann, Wiegerling, and Rathgeber 2024). This tradition stems from classical anthropology of the human as toolmaker (Prometheus), and from the philosophical and societal response to the industrial revolution and is thus relevant for the understanding of present-day developments in AI and robotics. While it has much to say about the similarities with earlier technologies, e.g. the increased “speed” of things (Rosa 2010, 2020), it is often struggling to articulate what is different about these new technologies, not to mention what is positive (Han 2022). In this tradition there is also a form of technology ethics, e.g. under the headings of “responsible research and innovation” (Burget, Bardone, and Pedaste 2017), “technology assessment” (Grunwald 2018) or “ethics by design” (Brey and Dainow 2024), often involving the wider socio-technical context (Koudina and Van de Poel 2024; Wang and Blok 2025).

A more political angle of technology is discussed in “Science and Technology Studies” (STS). As books like The Ethics of Invention (Jasanoff 2016) show, concerns in STS are often quite similar to those in ethics (Jacobs et al. 2019). Generally, the philosophy of AI is probably outgrowing the general philosophy and ethics of technology (SEP Article Franssen, Lokhorst, and van de Poel 2024), but it certainly remains the case that it is part of that larger picture, and has much to learn from the experience with technologies that were once new and revolutionary, such as water power, the steam engine, trains, electricity, cars, the personal computer, or the Internet. It may well be that the ever “smarter” environment we live in (Halpern and Mitchell 2023), and specifically AI, is both a curse (Vallor 2024) and a blessing for humanity. The human condition and the meaning of our lives are fundamentally affected by our socio-technical conditions, and AI will have massive impact on these conditions, so it looks like there should really be an analogous effort in academia and public discourse to understand the effects we want and those that we can achieve from this technology.

2.9.2 Politics

Traditionally, the ethics of AI had an unhealthy obsession with individual choice, rather than with social and political choice and conditions. There is now a focus on specifically political issues with AI (Crawford 2021), especially race, gender, minorities, feminism (Gebru 2020; Browne et al. 2023; Toupin 2024), environmental impact (O’Brolcháin and Grau Ruiz 2020; van Wynsberghe 2021), global justice (Lundgren et al. 2024) and the threat to democratic process, such as information and trust (Coeckelbergh 2024) – a survey is in (Coeckelbergh 2022a).

It appears that information technology had both impacts towards more fairness (universal access to information, e.g. scientific publications) but also towards less fairness (concentration of wealth). The larger the impact of AI and robotics will be, the more urgent these concerns will become. Also, they will seem larger to those that are more negatively affected – all of this would have sounded familiar to analysts like Karl Marx (Marx 1867/2024) and has begun to affect political theory (Risse 2023).

One of the fundamentals of democratic societies is the free spread of information, since a free political decision is only as good as the information it is based on. However, with the help of AI, fake news is automatically generated and spread, sometimes tailored to recipients – it has become cheaper than employing humans, and it spreads “farther, faster, deeper, and more broadly than the truth in all categories of information.” (Vosoughi, Roy, and Aral 2018). The control over information and narratives is often in the hand of oligarchs and monopolies, e.g. search engines are subject to essentially one company; see the recent SEP article (Tavani and Zimmer 2025). News distribution channels are also increasingly AI steered and generated.

AI generated social media are now the prime locations for political propaganda. This influence can be used to steer voting behaviour, as in the Facebook-Cambridge Analytica “scandal” (Woolley and Howard 2017; Bradshaw, Neudert, and Howard 2019) and – if successful – it may harm the autonomy of individuals (Susser, Roessler, and Nissenbaum 2019). Some authors (Sanders and Schneier 2024) stress that we should not make the same mistakes with AI that we made with social media, though the severity of the issue is disputed (Altay, Berriche, and Acerbi 2023). The main similarity is that problematic surveillance and manipulation can be automated, and thus applied to masses of people, while being personalised. AI can help individuals and societies make better choices – but not all agents in our information space want that to happen.

These developments not only support deception and manipulation, but also the era of “bullshit” (Frankfurt 2005), or post-truth, where anyone can have their own “alternative facts”, and thus any information is as good as any other (this is sometimes confused with “free speech”). Characteristically, the main aim of political propaganda through AI-generated content is not to spread misinformation, but to spread the impression that any information is as good as any other (Goldstein et al. 2023 [Other Internet Resources]). In the AI dominated news world, all news is reduced to vying for attention, to “click-baiting” – meaning that what is actually read is not what readers want to pay attention to. If the information on the basis of which humans take decisions is compromised or biased in a way that some voices are heard more than others, this is sometimes called “epistemic injustice” (Fricker 2007; Kay, Kasirzadeh, and Mohamed 2024). These developments have found significant interest in political science and media studies (Helbing et al. 2019; Coeckelbergh 2024), and some authors have diagnosed a form of fascism in contemporary AI developments (Mühlhoff 2025). Others have argued that the “hallucinations” that plague LLMs are a form of this “bullshit” (Hicks, Humphries, and Slater 2024) or create a “testimony gap” (Robert Sparrow and Flenady 2025).

It was common to consider what a repressive regime like that Hitler might have done with such techniques, but we do not need these fictional cases. It is already evident, that such techniques are used in pseudo-democracies, to ensure that elections go the intended way, that dissenting voices are silenced, and people controlled (e.g. in the name of “national security” or “fighting terrorism”). E.g. there is good reason to think that these moves from mainstream news media to AI-mediated “sharded media” have directly influenced the US presidential elections in 2024 (Merrin and Hoskins 2025). The technical angle of this discussion has been discussed by (O’Neil 2016) in her influential book Weapons of Math Destruction, and in (Yeung and Lodge 2019). – The politician Henry Kissinger has said we have “generated a potentially dominating technology in search of a guiding philosophy” (Kissinger 2018).

2.9.3 Natural Environment

One interesting question, that has received more attention in recent years, is whether the development of AI is environmentally sustainable: While there are clearly ecological benefits to AI (e.g. optimising energy efficiency (Skare, Gavurova, and Sinkovic 2025), or just replacing some business travel by video conferencing), AI hardware systems produce waste that is very hard to recycle, use materials that are environmentally damaging to generate, consume water for cooling, and consume vast amounts of energy, especially for the training and use (inference) of machine learning systems. Unfortunately, industry is actively hiding data about energy use. For the year 2022, where there is data, estimates for the percentage of total electricity used world-wide are: 0.04% for AI processors (De Vries 2023; Luers and Jonathan Koomey 2024), 0.38% for Bitcoin mining (Neumueller 2023), 1.8–2.6% for all data centres (Kamiya and Bertoldi 2024). A hardware-based prediction (de Vries-Gao 2025) puts all AI systems taken together on a power consumption level close to the Netherlands by 2025. (But still only half that of bitcoin mining and 20% of all non-crypto data centre use.) The massive investment into AI data centres indicates that from 2026 we might look at 20% increases year-on-year (O’Donnell and Crownhart 2025) – while any ecological gain is far less evident.

Giving the increasing problem of energy consumption, there is now significant technical research into making AI development and use more energy efficient. However, it is not clear that this will lead to reduced energy use, due to the “Jevons paradox”: More efficient use might cause more use, and thus more energy use overall. It appears that some actors in this space offload ecological costs to the general society. There is significant literature that stresses the importance of environmental issues in political philosophy of AI, e.g. (Bender et al. 2021; Crawford 2021; van Wynsberghe 2021; Bolte and van Wynsberghe 2024) – what is less clear is what the contribution of philosophical work in this space could be.

2.9.4 Economics

One fundamental societal impact of AI and robotics is on economic structures. There are changes in productivity, the distribution of wealth, the process of production, and in the labour market. While these are of political importance and of philosophical interest, we need to tread carefully here, rather than doing amateur economics.

The issue of fair distribution of goods in a society, and of justice, have been central in political philosophy since its beginnings. A standard view is that distributive justice should be rationally decided from behind a “veil of ignorance” (Rawls 1971), i.e. as if one does not know what position in a society one would actually be taking (labourer or industrialist, etc.). Rawls thought the chosen principles would then support basic liberties and a distribution that is of greatest benefit to the least-advantaged members of society. It would appear that the AI economy has three features that make such justice unlikely: First, it operates in a largely unregulated environment where responsibility is often hard to allocate. Second, it operates in markets that have a “winner takes all” feature, where monopolies develop quickly. Third the “new economy” of the digital service industries is based on intangible assets, also called “capitalism without capital” (Haskel and Westlake 2017). This means that it is difficult to control multinational digital corporations that do not rely on a physical plant in a particular physical location. These three features seem to suggest that if we leave the distribution of wealth to free market forces, the result would be an unjust distribution. This seems to be happening in the USA in the 2020s with a “k-shaped” economy where the benefits of economic growth are skewed towards high-wealth individuals.

One area where this is visible is that AI and robotics are technologies that are developed and exploited mainly in affluent societies, sometimes through exploitation of cheap labour. This has led to suggestions that some of the issues in this connection are “colonial” (Adams 2021; Mhlambi and Tiribelli 2023) and contribute to the massive global disparity of wealth – e.g. university professors in Africa will earn ca. 10% of those in Europe. Even within affluent societies the access to AI and participation in its use are unequally distributed – roughly along the lines of general inequality. There is also a significant discrepancy between US and Europe, in that the US dominates digital markets, especially services.

The area that is most prominent in public discussion is that “robots will take our jobs”, now perhaps “AI will take our jobs”. There is an experience, especially among manual labourers, that productivity gains through automation have led to unemployment. Is AI just another case of this? Unlike in 2020, an impact of AI systems on the labour market is now clearly visible, and more is widely predicted – after all, the main motivation of the enormous current AI investment (ca. 0.5 trillion US$ in 2025) is expected profit from productivity gains.

Philosophical responses to the issue of unemployment from AI have ranged from the alarmed (Carl Benedikt Frey and Osborne 2013; Westlake 2014) to the neutral (Metcalf, Keller, and Boyd 2016; Calo 2018; Carl Benedict Frey 2019) and the optimistic (Brynjolfsson and McAfee 2016; Harari 2016; Danaher 2019). For the moment, it appears that the overall impact of AI is that of generating more employment (World Economic Forum 2025), but there are indications that this will change.

In principle, the labour market effect of automation seems to be fairly well understood as involving two channels: “(i) the nature of interactions between differently skilled workers and new technologies affecting labour demand and (ii) the equilibrium effects of technological progress through consequent changes in labour supply and product markets” (Goos 2018, 362). What currently seems to happen in the labour market as a result of AI & robotics automation is “job polarisation” of the “dumbbell” shape (Goos, Manning, and Salomons 2009) where growth occurs at the high-skill and the low-skill ends of the market, while mid-skill jobs, i.e. the majority of jobs, are under pressure and reduced because they most likely to be automated (Baldwin 2019).

It seems clear that AI and robotics will lead to significant gains in productivity and thus overall societal wealth. It is said that the emphasis on “growth” is a modern phenomenon (Harari 2016, 240). The use of automation aims to increase productivity, such that fewer humans are required for the same output, or the product or service can be generated with lower cost.

This reduction in human workforce does not necessarily imply a loss of overall employment, because available wealth increases and that can increase demand sufficiently to counteract the productivity gain. In the long run, higher productivity in industrial societies has led to more wealth overall, especially since the industrial revolution. Major labour market disruptions have occurred in the past, e.g. in 1800 farming employed over 60% of the workforce in Europe and North-America, while by 2010 it employed ca. 5% in the same places (Anonymous 2013). Sometimes, these changes are fairly rapid, e.g. in the 20 years between 1950 and 1970 the number of hired agricultural workers in the UK was reduced by 50% (Zayed and Loft 2019). Also, the Jevons paradox (mentioned above on energy) might strike again: If, in some domain, the efficiency gain through AI is high enough to make a product cheaper, then the use might increase so much that overall need for workers is increased.

Classic automation in the industrial revolution replaced human muscle and manual labour, whereas digital automation now replaces human thought and intellectual work. Which areas of work are more prone to automation through is a question for the philosophy of AI, and it seems that artificial intelligence thrives where there are rules, patterns and norms, and especially where work is done with computers, already. Such rules and norms are ubiquitous: A lawyer knows how to draft a contract, an investment banker understands how to structure a deal, and a civil engineer can design a drainage system. In robotics, the classic argument is that the machines will take over the “dirty, dumb and dangerous” (DDD) jobs. If a job follows DDD patterns that can be taught, AI can learn it. It has been argued that the work of “professions” like lawyers, doctors, teachers has become an outdated monopoly (Susskind and Susskind 2022). In the creative industries there is a massive concern that the value of human creativity is merely exploited by ML systems (Anantrasirichai and Bull 2022) with disregard for intellectual property rights; but also that creativity will generally need to be re-evaluated (Du Sautoy 2019; Misselhorn 2023). There are now clear indications that academic teaching and academic research are similarly under threat: We are moving towards a world where machines “read” scientific publications “do research”, and “write”, “edit” or “review” scientific publications. (Perhaps science is moving in the direction of other publication systems that are overtaken by AI-generated “slop”.)

AI has a long history of overestimating the impact of its technology, but in the last 5 years the majority of predictions were underestimates. E.g. many in the field were surprised about the progress of generative AI, particularly in language (ChatGPT in Nov. 2022). However, actual human jobs stubbornly turn out more complicated than estimated. E.g., in 2016, Geoffrey Hinton said “We should stop training radiologists now. It’s just completely obvious that within five years, deep learning is going to do better than radiologists.”, but it turns out that this is not true, nearly a decade later, mainly because causal modelling is difficult (Obuchowicz et al. 2025). Given the high stakes, it is difficult to find an ethically good way to combine human and machine expertise in making such medical decisions (Savulescu et al. 2024). – The revolution in physical interaction with autonomous vehicles and robotics is taking a little longer, just like it is taking longer to make robots that can play football than it took to make computers that can play chess.

For the labour market, the main question is: Is it different, this time? Will the creation of new jobs and wealth keep up with the destruction of jobs? And even if it is not different, what are the transition costs, and who bears them? Do we need to make societal adjustments for a fair distribution of costs and benefits of digital automation? – Perhaps enormous productivity gains will allow an “age of leisure” to be realised, something (Keynes 1930) had predicted to occur around 2030, assuming a growth rate of 1% per annum? Actually, we have already reached the level he anticipated for 2030, but we are still working. Harari explains how this economical development allowed humanity to overcome hunger, disease and war – and now we aim for immortality and eternal bliss through AI, thus his book title Homo Deus (Harari 2016, 75 etc.). The question remains whether an age of leisure is desirable, and how we would live in such an age.

2.10 AI Policy

In our context, “policy” is the general name for measures that states or other organisations take to support a politically desirable impact; it can take many forms, though it is often rule-based, e.g. tax breaks on home-building will encourage citizens to build their own homes. Such policy is driven by all sorts of political aims, but many of these will be motivated by “ethics”, e.g. justice or positive impact for vulnerable people.

In the history of AI policy, there was a phase in around 2015–20 when many organisations, including national governments, the UN, OECD and EU, felt the need to formulate “ethical principles”, and many philosophers were involved in this work. The next phase of actual policy will involve stakeholders and a few experts on technology and ethics, as well as lawyers who actually formulate the laws and regulations – the attention given to philosophical work in that phase is much reduced, but much of it still runs under the heading of “AI ethics”.

Among philosophers there is still some discussion about the value of “ethical principles” for AI, for example the five principles, based on the classic four “middle principles” in bioethics (Beauchamp and Childress 2013): (1) beneficence, (2) non-maleficence, (3) autonomy, and (4) justice, plus (5) explicability (Floridi and Cowls 2019). The initiative “Artificial Intelligence for Social Good” (AI4SG) suggests seven – quite different – principles: (1) falsifiability and incremental deployment; (2) safeguards against the manipulation of predictors; (3) receiver-contextualised intervention; (4) receiver-contextualised explanation and transparent purposes; (5) privacy protection and data subject consent; (6) situational fairness; and (7) human-friendly “semanticisation” (Floridi et al. 2020; Floridi 2023b). The discussion on principles and guidelines ranges from the view that they are meaningless, toothless and politically harmful (Munn 2023), to useful “work in progress” (Lundgren 2023) towards operationalisation (Stix 2021; Bleher and Braun 2023; Taddeo, Blanchard, and Thomas 2024), software engineering (Antikainen et al. 2021), and a systemic approach (Wang and Blok 2025).

Current AI policy activities worldwide have been surveyed by the OECD AI policy observatory (https://oecd.ai/) since 2020. For activities prior to 2020, see (Jobin, Ienca, and Vayena 2019), and the useful history in (Smuha 2021b). The basic handbook is now (Bullock et al. 2024).

The most influential policy tools are the OECD “AI Principles” for a “human-centric approach to artificial intelligence” (adopted in 2019 and updated in 2024, https://oecd.ai/en/ai-principles) (OECD 2024). These focus on: 1) Inclusive growth, sustainable development and well-being, 2) Respect for the rule of law, human rights and democratic values, including fairness and privacy, 3) Transparency and explainability, 4) Robustness, security and safety, and 5) Accountability. OECD policy is now developed with the “Global Partnership on AI” (GPAI), which was founded in 2022 to advise global governments on AI regulation (https://gpai.ai).

The most advanced legal regulation exists in the EU, with the hope of a “Brussels Effect”, as with the General Data Protection Regulation (GDPR 2016): To lead the world on regulation (Lundgren et al. 2024). The AI regulation itself goes back to the “High-level expert group on AI”, which produced several relevant reports (AI HLEG 2019). The main component of this legal framework is the AI Act (EU Parliament 2024), which legally regulates AI applications by their risk, graded at five levels: unacceptable/high/general/limited/minimal. This includes risks in a consequentialist sense, as well as “risks to rights”. Wider policy concerns for the digital world that are strongly relevant for AI and robotics are laid down in the 2022 Digital Markets Act (EU Parliament 2022a), e.g. on monopolies of digital platforms and fair competition, and the 2022 Digital Services Act (EU Parliament 2022b), e.g. on disinformation and illegal content.

There is now a host of regulation relevant to AI and robotics in most nation states, though the approaches differ substantially, from libertarian support of free market (and Hobbes’ “war of all against all”) to state control. Industry sometimes claims that regulation stifles innovation and sometimes demands regulatory “guardrails”. The hopes for a world-wide regulation, as envisaged through GPAI and OECD, now seem low, since several state actors, especially the USA and China, are more interested in competitive advantage. Having said that, there is now a series of AI Safety Summits on the highest governmental level (Paris 2025, Seoul 2024, Bletchley Park 2023), the AI4People summits of the EU, the AI4Good summits of the ITU, etc. – so the issues of AI policy remain on the agenda of world politics.

3. Closing Note

The problems of the very concept of AI through computation have played a prominent role with several sections here, from privacy and manipulation, to politics, to superintelligence. It is remarkable how imagination or “vision” has played a central role since the very beginning of the discipline at the “Dartmouth Summer Research Project” (McCarthy et al. 1955; Simon and Newell 1958). And the evaluation of this vision is subject to dramatic change: In a few decades, we went from the slogans “AI is impossible” (Dreyfus 1972) and “AI is just automation” (Lighthill 1973) to “AI will solve all problems” (Kurzweil 1999), “AI may well kill us all” (Bostrom 2014), and “we know how to build AGI” (Altman 2025). This created media attention and PR efforts, but it also raises the problem how much of this “philosophy and ethics of AI” is really about AI, rather than about an imagined technology. – As we said at the outset, AI and robotics have raised fundamental questions about what we should do with these systems, what the systems themselves should do, and what risks they have in the long term. They also challenge the human view of humanity as the intelligent and dominant species on Earth. We have seen issues that have been raised, and we will have to analyse technological and social developments closely to learn for traditional problems of philosophy, and to help develop a positive vision for human society with AI and robotics.

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Acknowledgments

The colleagues worldwide did all the work that is reported here. The members of my Centre for Philosophy and AI Research {PAIR} at Erlangen have been and are an inspiration. I am particularly grateful for detailed comments to Leonard Dung, Max Hellrigel-Holderbaum, Hadeel Naeem, and Ian Robertson.

I am very grateful for funding from the Alexander von Humboldt Foundation, the German Ministry for Education and Research (BMBF), the European Commission, the Dutch Research Council (NWO) and the Research Council of Norway (NF).

Copyright © 2026 by
Vincent C. Müller <vincent.c.mueller@fau.de>

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