1. The term was coined in 1927, in Polish, by Stanisław Leśniewski (see below), probably as a variant of the term ‘merology’ originally used to indicate the field of anatomy concerned with body fluids and elementary tissues; see Simons (1997a: 90, n. 4). In some literature, ‘mereology’ is also used with reference to work in General Systems Theory devoted to the study of system decomposition, as in Mesarović et al. (1970), or for the school of ecological thought that seeks to explain higher levels of organization in terms of individual organisms, following Hutchinson (1978: 214ff). Such uses are not covered in this entry.

2. For more on the history of mereology, see Burkhardt and Dufour (1991) and the historical entries in Burkhardt et al. (2017). On ancient theories, especially Plato’s and Aristotle’s, see also Barnes (1988), Harte (2002), Koslicki (2006, 2008), and Arci (2012), whereas Oosthout (2025) focuses on the Neoplatonists. On the medieval period, see Andrew Arlig’s entry medieval mereology and references therein. On modern views, see Costa (2022) along with e.g., Gruszczyński (2022) on Galileo; Peterman (2019) on Cavendish; Burkhardt and Degen (1990), R. Cook (2000), Mugnai (2019), and Costantini (2025) on Leibniz; and Baxter (1988c) and Holden (2002) on Hume. On Kant, see e.g., Marschall (2019).

3. For detailed treatments of Husserl’s formal theory of parts and wholes, see Simons (1982a), Null (1983), Blecksmith and Null (1991), Fine (1995b), Casari (2000, 2007), Ridder (2002: §VI.2), and Correia (2004). On Brentano’s views, see Baumgartner and Simons (1993), Baumgartner (2013), Salice (2017), and Kriegel (2018: §1.6). Brentano’s views, in turn, have been influenced by Bernand Bolzano’s, about whose mereology see Krickel (1995).

4. Detailed expositions of Leśniewski’s mereology may be found in Simons (1987: §2.6; 2018), Ridder (2002: §I.1.2), and Urbaniak (2014: ch. 5). For comprehensive surveys and historical background, see also Luschei (1962), Clay (1980), Miéville (1984), Gessler (2005), and Pietruszczak (2024) as well as the entry on Leśniewski. The first presentation of Leśniewski’s mereology in English was given by Tarski (1937).

5. An early version of the Calculus was developed in ch. 4 of Leonard’s (1930) doctoral dissertation, written under Whitehead’s supervision. The joint version was first presented by Leonard and Goodman at the 1936 meeting of the Association for Symbolic Logic in Cambridge, MA. For a comprehensive account, see Eberle (1970) and Breitkopf (1978). For an historical reconstruction, see Cohnitz and Rossberg (2006: ch. 4), Rossberg (2009), and the supplement The Calculus of Individuals in its different versions in the entry Nelson Goodman. On Whitehead’s precursory work, see Simons (1991b, 2017), Ridder (2001, 2002: §IV.3), and Richard (2011).

6. Strictly speaking, here one could also draw a distinction between the matter of which an object is made (e.g., clay) and the specific portion or lump of matter that actually constitutes the object. We shall set such details aside, but see H. M. Cartwright (1970, 1975), Chappell (1971), Laycock (1975), Grandy (1975), and Burge (1977) for some classic works on the distinction and the entry on the Metaphysics of Mass Expressions for a comprehensive survey.

7. Actually, the original Calculus of Individuals had variables for classes; a class-free, nominalistic version of the system appeared later in Goodman (1951). On the link between mereology and nominalism, see Eberle 1970. For a recent characterization, see Meyers (2014).

8. In the literature, the parthood relation is often represented by non-alphabetic symbols supporting infix notation, such as ‘≤’ or ‘<’ (the notation used in Leonard and Goodman 1940 and favored by Simons 1987) and the like. The same applies to the non-primitive mereological relations defined in the remainder of this entry. For instance, proper parthood is sometimes symbolized as ‘≪’ (but also, again, as ‘<’), overlap as ‘○’ or ‘≬’, disjointness as ‘⥍’, ‘≀’, ‘†’, ‘|’, or ‘)(’, etc. This has resulted in a plethora of different notations that is both overwhelming and confusing, as no canonical choice has been settled upon. Here we stick to the safer practice of sacrificing all infix notation in favor of ordinary, mnemonic upper-case letters (single or compound), with the only exception of the identity predicate.

9. This choice of logic is not without consequences. Particularly when it comes to the mereological operators of sum, product, etc. defined in Sections 4.2–4.4, a free logic would arguably provide a more adequate background (see Eberle 1970, Simons 1991a, Tennant 2013, and Link 2014: §13.3), as would a logic equipped with the apparatus of plural quantification (following Lewis 1991). However, here we shall go along with the simplifications afforded by the assumption of a classic logical background (with descriptive terms treated à la Russell 1905).

10. The labels follow Varzi (1996) and Casati and Varzi (1999: ch. 3).

11. That this is just a matter of “choosing a suitable primitive” is confirmed by the fact that in 1920 Leśniewski himself provided an alternative axiomatization of Mereology based on ‘P’ (see 1927–1931: ch. VII). It should be noted, however, that throughout his writings Leśniewski used ‘part’ (część) in the sense in which we are using ‘proper part’ (PP). His word for our use of ‘part’ (P) was ‘ingredient’ (ingredyens), apparently following a suggestion by Lucjan Zarzecki. See Leśniewski (1916: §2).

12. The version of the Calculus of Individuals presented in Leonard’s (1930) dissertation used yet another primitive, corresponding to the sum operator defined in (40_i) below (with i=3). The idea of using ‘D’ as a primitive may also be found in Leśniewski, who provided an axiomatization of Mereology based on this predicate—in his terminology: ‘exterior’ (zewnętrzny)—already in 1921; see Leśniewski (1927–1931: ch. X).

13. Up to the Winter 2012 edition.

14. In the literature, (P.4) is sometimes called ‘Weak Supplementation’, in contrast to the Strong Supplementation principle (P.5) discussed in Section 3.2. This is also Simons’s terminology. (To be precise, Simons’s formulation of (P.4) uses ‘PP’ also in the consequent, as in (P.4′) below, but in a standard setting the difference is immaterial owing to the reflexivity of P.) As for (P.4_a) and (P.4_b), the nomenclature is from Varzi (2007: 955). Other authors speak of ‘Non-identity Supplementation’ and ‘Non-parthood Supplementation’, respectively (e.g., Bynoe 2011: 93f).

15. In this form, the principle is also known as ‘Witness’ (Landman 1991), ‘Separation’ (Pietruszczak 2000a), ‘Leftover’ (Yablo 2014), or ‘Remainder’ (B. Smith 1997; Hudson 2002), though this last term is more commonly used for a stronger principle, corresponding to (P.6) below.

16. Further options remain. For example, some authors have considered the following strengthening of Strong Company, known as “Very Strong Companionship” (Koons 2014: 174), “Super-Strong Company” (Cotnoir and Varzi 2021: 131), or “Full Company” (Loss 2022a: 250):

17. See Metaphysics, Η, 1045a10. Some of these arguments are closely related to the arguments from material coincidence, as one may similarly distinguish an object from its constituting matter by virtue of their differing mereological rigidity. See Zimmerman (1995), Koslicki (1999), Barnett (2004), Kleinschmidt (2007), Donnelly and Bittner (2008), Tanksley (2010), and Laycock (2011) for relevant discussion.

18. The development of formal systems designed to capture part-whole relationships in the context of quantum theory is in itself a challenging and expanding research area, further complicated by the loss of individuality characteristic of the quantum domain. We do not cover these developments here, but see Krause (2011, 2017), Calosi and Tarozzi (2014), da Costa and Holik (2015), Obojska (2019), Banchetti-Robino (2020), Holik and Jorge (2023), Näger and Strobach (2025), and Wilhelm (forthcoming) for further representative contributions.

19. Recall that, given (P.1) and (P.2), Antisymmetry follows from Supplementation, but Supplementation does not follow from Strong Supplementation unless Antisymmetry is independently assumed. (Compare the model in Figure 3, middle.) In this sense, the appellation ‘strong’ is somewhat misleading.

20. (P.6) is also known as ‘Remainder’, following Simons (1987: 88) and Cotnoir and Varzi (2019, 2021). Sometimes the label ‘Super-Strong Supplementation’ is also used (e.g., Cotnoir 2016). However, this label—or its variant ‘Strong Super-Supplementation’—is more commonly associated with the following principle, which is equivalent to (P.6) only under Reflexivity and Transitivity:

See Gruszczyński and Pietruszczak (2014) and Pietruszczak (2013: §3.6), though the principle itself comes from Grzegorczyk (1955: 91) and can ultimately be traced to an unpublished 1920s axiomatization of Leśniewski’s Mereology due to Jan Drewnowski (see Świętorzecka and Łyczak 2020).

21. On this point, I am thankful to Anthony Shiver and Aaron Cotnoir for helpful discussion.

22. In Whitehead (1920: 76) the axiom is initially assumed to hold only for finite events, but the restriction is dropped in “reading over the proofs” (pp. 197–198).

23. The first term comes from Leśniewski (in Polish: suma, first used in part V of 1927–1931) whereas the second is from Leonard and Goodman (1940). In most current literature they are used interchangeably, though some authors reserve ‘sum’ specifically for the notion corresponding to (39₂) (or its infinitary extension (52₂) discussed below), which corresponds to Leśniewski’s definition, and ‘fusion’ for the notion corresponding to (39₃) (or (52₃)), which corresponds to Leonard and Goodman’s. For details, see Gruszczyński and Pietruszczak (2010) and Gruszczyński (2013).

24. Given Reflexivity and Transitivity, the definiens in (39₁) is equivalent to

This is how the notion of a sum₁ is sometimes defined in the literature, for ease of comparison with sum₃. See Bostock (1979: 114). For definitions that do not presuppose Transitivity, see Pietruszczak (2014).

25. If the condition is not satisfied, the sum may not exist, in which case the standard treatment of descriptive terms that we are assuming implies that the corresponding instances of the principles that follow are false. Strictly speaking, (41)–(47) should therefore be in conditional form. For instance, (41) should read

On this understanding, we use the non-conditional form for perspicuity. Ditto for (50)–(51) below.

26. The logical system underlying Leśniewski’s formal presentation of Mereology (Ontology) employs quantifiable terms that admit singular as well as plural interpretations (see especially Leśniewski, 1927–1931, part xi: ‘On ‘singular’ propositions of the type ‘Aεb’’). For details, see Simons (1982b; 1987: §§4.3–4.5; 1992) and, for explicit comparisons with contemporary plural logic, Simons (1997b).

27. As with (39₁), under Reflexivity and Transitivity the definiens in (52₁) is equivalent to

28. Strictly speaking, (P.17) does more than advertised, admitting instances that are false in some models of GEM. The intended result requires that Filtration be restricted to those cases when ∃wφw holds, like each (P.15_i). See Varzi (2019: §3).

29. June 2003 edition. The inaccuracy was corrected in the Spring 2009 edition.

30. Actually, the axioms appear in the 1956 English translation but not the French 1929 original. For details, see Betti (2013) and Tennant (2019: §2.1).

31. The idea of axiomatizing mereology using a sum operator as primitive may already be found in Leśniewski (1927–1931: thm. CCLXIV), based on the following variant of (47):

One could also use a primitive notion of general sum, though a proper treatment requires a stronger logical setting, e.g., plural quantification (Łyczak 2024) or quantification over sets (Gruszczyński and Li 2025).

32. A similar result is stated in Niebergall (2009b: 343; 2011: 288), with unpublished proof in Niebergall (2009c). An even earlier finite axiomatization along these lines, ignored in subsequent literature, was given by Pietruszczak (2000b: §vi.9, orig. §vi.7).

33. Tsai’s presentation also includes the ‘O’ instance of the ξ-Product schema (P.13_ξ), though this further axiom is not needed. See Cotnoir and Varzi (2021: 234, n. 9).

34. We say ‘virtually’ because, strictly speaking, Tarski’s result refers to a stronger version of GEM in which the unrestricted existence of mereological sums is secured by means of an axiom that quantifies explicitly over sets. This is of course a relevant difference, for the reasons mentioned at the beginning of Section 4.3. For set-free formulations which, like those considered here, strictly adhere to a standard first-order language, the correct way of summarizing the algebraic strength of GEM is this: Any model of this theory is isomorphic to a Boolean subalgebra of a complete Boolean algebra with the zero element removed—a subalgebra that is not necessarily complete if Zermelo-Frankel set theory with Choice is consistent. See Pontow and Schubert (2006), Theorem 34, for details and proof. For other presentations of Tarski’s result, based on different ways axiomatizations of GEM, see Pietruszczak (2000b: chs. 3 and 6), Ridder (2002: ch. 3), Hovda (2009: §4), and Cotnoir and Varzi (2021: §§2.2–2.3. For a detailed historical reconstruction, see Loeb (2014).

35. Strictly speaking, Pontow and Schubert’s (2006) axiomatization does not include (P.10). Since the null item qualifies as a sum₃—in the relevant sense—of the empty set, its existence is secured simply by dropping the antecedent in (P.15_3G).

36. This is not to say that classical mereology can really serve as a substitute for set theory in the foundations of mathematics, pace Leśniewski’s endeavors. See e.g., Niebergall (2007) and Hamkins and Kikuchi (2016).

37. Some authors prefer the term ‘knug’, the reverse spelling of ‘gunk’ (J. Parsons 2007: 209; Sorensen 2016: 71). Note that ‘junk’ is sometimes used with a different meaning, as in Van Cleve (2008: 323), where it refers to the rich ontology that comes with the acceptance of unrestricted composition.

38. In some literature, this principle is also known as ‘Downwards Seriality’ (Lucas 2000: §9.12), ‘Inverse Gunkness’ (Adžić and Arsenijević 2014: §2), ‘Coatomlessness’ (Cotnoir and Varzi 2021: §5.5), or simply ‘Junk’ (e.g., Cotnoir 2014b).

39. The label is meant to mark a contrast with the “General Composition Question”, which asks: What is composition? (1987: 24; 1990: 39).

40. This literature is even more extensive if one considers that the argument has found application in several other areas of metaphysics. For example, Sider (2001) uses it to support a four-dimensionalist view of persistence and Wallace (2014) to support five-dimensionalism (the view that objects have modal parts), whereas Effingham (2009) and Wake (2011) challenge it from the standpoint of supersubstantivalism (the view that material objects are spacetime regions). Moreover, there is an extensive literature on whether the argument withstands particular theories of vagueness, such as epistemicism (Hudson 2001: ch. 3; Kurtsal Steen 2014; Magidor 2018). We will not examine such ramifications, but see the entry on ordinary objects, Section 2.2, for a concise guided tour.

41. The label is from Lewis (1991: §3.6), though the thesis itself has a long history and goes back to Plato. See Harte (2002: ch. 2), Pasnau (2011: §28.5), Arlig (2012), Normore and Brown (2014), and Cotnoir and Varzi (2021: §5.2.3).

42. It should be noted that most formulations resort to formalisms that go beyond the resources of a standard first-order language, e.g. languages with plural terms and quantifiers. For details, see Cotnoir (2014a) and Hovda (2014a).

43. Primarily due to its apparent conflict with Leibniz’s law: what is true of the many is not exactly what is true of the one. Lewis himself finds this troubling (1991: 87) whereas Baxter (2014) explicitly disavows the indiscernibility of identicals, though see e.g., Kim (2019, 2026) for a proposed resolution. Other critics raise broader objections—for example, that Composition as Identity precludes the possibility of strongly emergent properties (McDaniel 2008) or that it sits uneasily with widely held views about grounding (Bailey 2011, Turner 2013) or with evidence from quantum mechanics (Calosi and Morganti 2016).

44. Even Democritus, far from holding the atomistic conception of composition one often attributes to him, might have been a minimalist of this sort: “The first principles are atoms and void; everything else exists only in opinion” (Diogenes Laërtius, Lives, ix, 44). On Buddhist minimalism, especially in relation to contemporary mereology, see Westerhoff (2013), Jones (2021), and Siderits (2022: ch. 4).

45. To be precise, van Inwagen uses ‘universalism’ for the thesis that any plurality of material objects has a sum (specifically, an S₂-sum) and ‘super-universalism’ for the stronger thesis corresponding to (P.15₂) (1987: 35, 1990: 74). Some authors use ‘universalism’ in an even narrower sense, corresponding to the thesis that distinct material objects always compose a further material object (see e.g., Effingham 2011a). Today, however, it is customary to use the term for any thesis covered by (P.15_i). In this general sense, universalism is also known as ‘conjunctivism’ (Van Cleve 1986, Chisholm 1987), ‘collectivism’ (Hoffman and Rosenkrantz 1999), or ‘maximalism’ (Simons 2006). Nihilism, in turn, is also known as ‘monadism’ (Hoffman and Rosenkrantz 1997), ‘minimalism’ (Simons 2006), or ‘eliminativism’ (Merricks 2001).

46. Of course, which mereological principles should hold remains controversial, and may depend on the specific de dicto account one endorses. See e.g., Donnelly (2014: 56ff) on the status of the Unrestricted Sum₂ principle.

47. Strictly speaking, Parsons relies on the notion of a sum₁, hence unrestricted minimal upper bounds, but the argument also applies under the other construals of that notion examined in Section 4.2.

48. Strictly speaking, Smith works with a notion of (concrete) part that involves a double world-time index, but for the simple principles under discussion here both indices can be omitted as irrelevant.