Philippa Foot

First published Fri Aug 17, 2018; substantive revision Fri Aug 28, 2026

Philippa Foot wrote extensively on metaethics, moral psychology, and applied ethics, and authored Natural Goodness, a monograph introducing a distinctive form of ethical naturalism. Across her career, she defended the objectivity of morality against noncognitivist and subjectivist views, while engaging deeply with questions about moral reasons and motivation, notably revising her position on whether moral judgments necessarily supply reasons for action. Beyond academic philosophy, she is widely known for introducing the Trolley Problem, which probes the apparent asymmetry between redirecting a threat from five people to one and deliberately causing harm to one person to save five. Alongside G. E. M. Anscombe, Mary Midgley, and Iris Murdoch, Foot was also a member of the so-called “Quartet,” a group of prominent women philosophers associated with Oxford before and during the Second World War. She played a central role in the revival of Aristotelian virtue ethics in contemporary philosophy, though she herself resisted identification with the view in its now-standard forms.

1. Life

Philippa Foot was born Philippa Ruth Bosanquet on October 3, 1920, in Owston Ferry, Lincolnshire, and grew up in Kirkleatham, in North Yorkshire, England. Her mother, Esther, was a daughter of U.S. President Grover Cleveland. Her father, William was an industrialist, running a large Yorkshire steel works. Foot studied philosophy, politics, and economics at Somerville College, a women’s college within the University of Oxford. Foot had no formal education as a child; as she puts it, she “lived in the sort of milieu where there was a lot of hunting, shooting, and fishing, and where girls simply did not go to college” (Voorhoeve 2009: 91). In her youth, she was educated by governesses, from whom she claimed she did not even learn “which came first, the Romans or the Greeks” (Conradi & Lawrence 2010). Despite this poor childhood education Foot was able to secure a position at Oxford by way of a correspondence course on Latin and working with an Oxford entrance coach.

Her earliest philosophy tutor at Somerville was Donald MacKinnon, a philosopher and theologian with interests in Plotinus, Kant, and Hegel. G. E. M. Anscombe, Mary Midgley, and Iris Murdoch, who would all go on to have distinguished philosophical careers, were also at Oxford at the time. These four philosophers, recently dubbed “the Quartet,” formed lasting intellectual relationships during their Oxford years and influenced one another’s philosophical development (Lipscomb 2022; Mac Cumhaill and Wiseman 2022). Foot earned a BLitt from Somerville for her research on Kant in 1942, and then worked in London for the remainder of the war. At the end of the war, she married the military historian M. R. D. Foot (the marriage ended in 1960) and returned to Somerville College to take up a teaching position, becoming a fellow in 1949. Anscombe had begun a research fellowship at Somerville in 1946, and Foot credits her with introducing her to the philosophy of Ludwig Wittgenstein.

Foot resigned her fellowship at Somerville in 1969 and spent several years in the United States as a visiting professor, holding appointments at the University of California (in Los Angeles and Berkeley), Washington, Princeton, Stanford, and the City University of New York. In 1976, she took up a permanent position at the University of California, Los Angeles, where she remained until her retirement in 1991. She then returned to Oxford, where she completed her monograph, Natural Goodness. Foot’s final philosophical article, “Rationality and Goodness,” appeared in 2004, and she died on her ninetieth birthday, October 3, 2010.

It is sometimes said that Foot was a founding member of Oxfam; however, the earliest records of her involvement date from 1948, six years after the founding of the Oxford Committee for Famine Relief. She remained active in Oxfam throughout her life (Hursthouse 2012: 180–181).

2. Ethical Naturalism in Foot’s Early Writings

In a trio of early articles, Foot criticizes then-prevailing noncognitivist accounts of moral judgment and sketches an alternative account. Her primary targets are emotivism and prescriptivism. On these views, moral judgments are characterized by a distinctive attitudinal component, namely, a pro or con attitude absent from straightforward descriptive claims. The presence of such an attitude, rather than the content of the judgment, determines whether it counts as moral. In “Moral Arguments” (1958), Foot memorably characterizes such positions as advancing a “private enterprise theory of moral criteria,” since they treat the individual’s attitudes as decisive for the status of a judgment (1958 [VV 108]).

Her response draws on Wittgenstein’s later philosophy, especially the idea of a grammatical investigation. This approach examines concepts in the contexts of their use in the practical context of language games, rather than through abstract theorizing liable to distort or obscure such use. On this approach, the application of moral terms can be seen to be governed by public criteria and cannot be fixed by arbitrary stipulation on the part of individual speakers. Foot therefore argues that the content of a belief is essential to whether a judgment counts as a genuine moral judgment.

The noncognitivist views Foot attacks depend on two assumptions that she seeks to dismantle in “Moral Beliefs” (1959). The first is that what counts as evidence for an evaluative conclusion in no way depends on what others count as evidence. Foot argues that this presupposes that the meaning of a term such as ‘good’ includes a distinct evaluative component, independent of any consideration of the proper objects of things deemed good. The second assumption is that one may refuse to draw an evaluative conclusion even in the face of what others regard as decisive evidence. This supposes that one might admit that there are grounds for calling someone courageous, in that he defended his family against a fearsome attacker, yet refuse to praise him for his courage. In such a case, ‘courageous’ is said to be used only in a descriptive, “inverted commas” sense that avoids the evaluative commitment the term ordinarily carries. Together, these assumptions erect a divide between factual and evaluative judgments that Foot aims to undermine.

Against the first assumption, Foot argues that the term ‘good’ is analogous to ‘pride’ in having limits on its intelligible use. The analogy turns on the fact that pride is an evaluative emotion nevertheless tied to definite descriptive content: one cannot intelligibly feel pride about just anything. To take pride in something is to regard it as one’s own achievement, so its object must be something one has had a hand in bringing about. For example, if I believed I had been awarded a prize for the best pumpkin and felt proud of this, but it turned out that someone else’s pumpkin had won, I could not intelligibly continue to feel pride. Moreover, what one takes pride in must be some sort of achievement or advantage. It would not make sense to feel pride in laying one hand over another three times in an hour, unless there is a special background condition, such as a stroke, that makes this a difficult task and a significant step in recovery. Foot concludes that it is not sufficient for the attribution of a certain emotion that a person be in a given mental state.[1] Rather, the person must stand in an appropriate relationship to a proper object of those feelings. In this way, Foot attempts to show that “even feelings are logically vulnerable to facts” (1959 [VV 115]).

Analogously, Foot thinks that someone must stand in an appropriate relation to a proper object of ‘good’ in order genuinely to judge something good. Consider someone who takes it to be a duty to clasp his hands three times in an hour, praises others for doing so, and so on. This raises the question of why we should regard these claims as bona fide moral judgments rather than as some sort of game. Foot maintains that for such claims to count as moral judgments there must be some special background. In this case, the person would have to point to some connection between the practice and some significant stake; there must be a connection to human good or harm (1959 [VV 120]). In the absence of such a background, she argues, it is logically impossible to regard the practice as morally good.

Against the second assumption, namely, that we might rationally fail to draw an evaluative conclusion from what others regard as definitive evidence, Foot argues in “Moral Beliefs” that we all have reason to act on what is shown to be in our interests. If an action can be shown to be in our interests, we have reason to perform it. Assuming there are no conflicting actions that would serve us better, we ought to do it, and it would be irrational and bad not to do so. Foot then aims to show that cultivating the virtues is always in one’s interest, and failing to do so is necessarily against one’s interest. She thereby claims to show that we each have reason to cultivate the virtues, regardless of our present desires. In the course of her argument, she attempts to refute the position advocated by Thrasymachus in Plato’s Republic, namely, that it is more profitable to be unjust, a view she labels “Thrasymachus’ thesis” (1959 [VV 125]). Her aim is thus to show that justice, along with the other cardinal virtues of courage, prudence, and temperance, is in some sense profitable, even though these virtues may at times demand extreme sacrifice, including the sacrifice of one’s life.

Foot compares injustice with physical injury, focusing primarily on injuries to the limbs. She holds that we all have reason to avoid injuries that impair the functioning of some part of our bodies or create lasting pain. Of course, circumstances may arise where there would be some advantage to sustaining an injury. In such cases, we can say that there are overriding or all things considered reasons to sustain or risk an injury, but, clearly, we would avoid the injury if the gain could be realized in another way. No rational person seeks injury for itself, and every rational person avoids injury. An injury is something that we should always want to avoid because it is a physical change that impairs the function of a particular body part, and we all have reason to want our bodies to function properly (1959 [VV 116–117; 122]). General facts concerning human beings support the idea that rational people must want their limbs intact.

Similarly, Foot thinks there are general features of human life that explain why it is rationally necessary for us to value and cultivate the virtues. She argues that the virtues are as essential to the fulfillment of our desires as our limbs are to the execution of our purposes. Although we may choose to live in isolation or find ourselves involuntarily isolated, human beings ordinarily pursue their ends within a social environment. As a result, our attempts to satisfy our desires are constantly liable to interference or assistance from others. We therefore stand to benefit from social practices defined by mutual respect and fidelity to promises, and this is a benefit that all rational agents have reason to value, given the fundamentally social character of human life.

Foot recognized one of the most obvious objections to this position, namely, the ‘tight corner.’ Even someone who concedes that it is generally beneficial to be just must acknowledge that there are circumstances in which it is very costly. Given those costs, it may seem rational to embrace injustice. In “Moral Beliefs,” Foot argued that by concentrating on the costs of particular just acts in isolation, this objection fails to recognize the value of the general disposition to be just (1959 [VV 129–30]). But later she cites the objection as a reason for her change of view in “Morality as a System of Hypothetical Imperatives” (VV x). Ultimately, her early position on the rationality of morality is that we should not focus on the rationality of isolated actions, but rather the rationality of adopting the general disposition to be just.[2]

In “When is a Principle a Moral Principle?” (1954), “Moral Arguments,” and “Moral Beliefs,” Foot sketches a distinctive non-utilitarian naturalistic ethics in which the virtues play a central role and are characterized as dispositions that generally benefit their possessors and others. Because facts about human life define the content of morality, her early view is best understood as a version of ethical naturalism. Her case for such an ethics is notably motivated by metaethical concerns, namely, her dissatisfaction with the subjectivism of then prevailing noncognitivist theories.

3. Against Moral Rationalism

Among Foot’s most influential and controversial papers is “Morality as a System of Hypothetical Imperatives” (1972, MSHI). There, she reverses her earlier position on the rationality of morality. She retains her earlier view that self-interest is rationally required: someone who lacks a desire for what is in their self-interest is irrational. Yet she abandons the claim that morality coincides with self-interest and arrives at the position that morality provides reasons only if we possess the relevant rationally optional desires, such as a desire to advance the welfare of others. Although she notes this change of view, she does not revisit her earlier position in any sustained way.[3]

The term ‘hypothetical imperative’ comes from Immanuel Kant’s moral philosophy, where it is contrasted with the ‘categorical imperative.’ A hypothetical imperative is a command or ought-statement whose reason-giving force depends on the agent having a certain purpose. For example, whether I ought to purchase an airplane ticket to New York today typically depends on whether I have the purpose of going there. If I lack that purpose, or give up on it, then no one would have grounds to say that I ought to buy the ticket. By contrast, categorical imperatives do not depend on our having any particular purpose; they have normative authority regardless of our purposes.

In MSHI, Foot challenges the Kantian idea that morality must consist of categorical imperatives. This idea derives much of its force from the fact that moral obligations seem to make a claim on everyone, regardless of their purposes or desires. We tell children that they should not tell lies even when a successful fib would serve their central purpose of escaping blame or punishment. But Foot argues that the surface grammar of moral judgments is misleading. She makes her case by way of an analogy between morality and etiquette.

Etiquette and morality differ in many ways, but both tell us what we ought to do. Further, Foot points out that rules of etiquette are often presented in the same categorical form as moral considerations; etiquette tells us what must and must not be done, full stop. Imperatives such as “You should not discuss money” or “Don’t make personal remarks” employ a categorical form. Foot calls these “non-hypothetical uses” of ought (1972 [VV 160]). Yet she takes it to be obvious that the demands of etiquette are rationally optional. Hence, the rules of etiquette do not give me any reason to act on them unless I have the purpose of being regarded as well-mannered.

Of course, there is still a sense in which the rules of etiquette are unconditional. I count as ‘gauche’ if I flout the requirements of etiquette, regardless of my purposes. Still, Foot thinks it cannot be said that I necessarily have reason to conform to such rules, concluding:

if a hypothetical use of ‘should’ gave a hypothetical imperative, and a non-hypothetical use of ‘should’ gave a categorical imperative, then ‘should’ statements based on rules of etiquette, or rules of a club would be categorical imperatives (1972 [VV 160–161]).

But the demands of etiquette do not give us categorical imperatives. We therefore cannot rely on the surface grammar of ‘should’ or ‘ought’ statements to determine whether an imperative is categorical or hypothetical.

Foot applies this line of thought to moral ‘ought’ statements as well. Though they are stated in categorical form, there is no reason to think that someone who acts against them is thereby irrational. It is perfectly plausible, she argues, to think that moral judgments provide reasons only if we have the purpose of doing what we should do from the moral point of view. As with etiquette, the claims of morality are, in some sense, unconditional in that one does not cease to be wicked simply by lacking the purpose of being moral. As Foot states:

the man who rejects morality because he sees no reason to obey its rules can be convicted of villainy but not of inconsistency. (1972 [VV 161])

This is because such an amoral agent does not act against any purpose that he has, and therefore cannot be said to be irrational, even though he remains immoral.

The next question Foot addresses is what the implications for morality would be if moral requirements turned out to be hypothetical imperatives. Many philosophers have regarded this as a catastrophic possibility. Immanuel Kant, for example, believed that if morality were merely hypothetically imperative, moral conduct would ultimately rest on selfish or pleasure-seeking motives. Yet Foot argues that Kant’s view of human psychology is too narrow, stating:

Quite apart from thoughts of duty a man may care about the suffering of others, having a sense of identification with them and wanting to help if he can. (1972 [VV 165])

Of course, helping others for the sake of cultivating a reputation for charity is incompatible with the virtue of charity. But one may simply desire to help others, and in that case, no categorical imperative is needed to motivate charitable action.

Justice, as Foot recognizes, cannot be motivated solely by concern for the good of others. Justice notoriously comes into conflict with welfare, since there may be cases in which clearly unjust actions, like theft from rich people to redistribute to the poor, may lead to overall beneficial outcomes. This leads Foot to suggest that just persons are concerned with truth and liberty, and that they “want every man to be treated with a certain respect” (1972 [VV 165]). In her view, then, a morally good agent possesses a variety of independent commitments that motivate them to act on considerations concerning the well-being and rights of others. Foot evidently takes this to be a plausible picture of moral psychology that has been insufficiently appreciated because of the widespread assumption that morality consists of categorical imperatives.

At the conclusion of MSHI, Foot makes an even bolder claim. She imagines that critics of her position will insist that we have a duty to adopt moral ends, yet she regards the very idea that we have a duty to have certain ends as nonsensical. It is, of course, trivially true that we morally ought to have moral ends; from the perspective of morally good people, such ends appear obligatory. However, the objection presupposes a use of ‘ought’ that is not tied to any particular institution, practice, or person’s perspective, and Foot argues that the appearance of such a sense of ‘ought’ is illusory (1972 [VV 167]). In this respect, she claims to offer a “defictionalized” conception of morality (1975 [VV 174]).

Foot’s middle-period view on the rationality of morality has generated extensive debate. To critics, the view leaves morality alarmingly defenseless: those lacking the relevant desires simply have no reason to act morally, and there can be no reason to cultivate those desires in their absence. Prominent defenders of moral rationalism have therefore criticized Foot’s analogy between morality and etiquette. Yet her position is often misrepresented in these debates. It is sometimes assumed that Foot adopts a wholly conventional conception of morality by drawing this analogy. But she never abandons her earlier view that morality has a determinate content grounded in facts about human life. Another feature of her middle-period position that is frequently overlooked is her continued rationalism about self-interest: considerations of self-interest always provide reasons for action, regardless of one’s desires.[4] Foot is therefore not a thoroughgoing externalist, since she does not think that all reasons depend on desires that one might rationally lack. Rather, she defends an externalism only about the reasons generated by moral considerations. Thus, even during this period, she does not hold that all normative claims generate merely hypothetical imperatives. Still, on Foot’s view at this stage of her career, moral oughts are not categorical imperatives.

4. Applied Ethics

Foot was among the pioneers of applied ethics, writing on topics such as abortion and euthanasia. In her approach to these issues, she is guided by a concern to balance justice and charity. For reasons made explicit only in later writings, she rejects consequentialist theories of value, including utilitarianism, in which maximizing welfare is the only ultimate concern. In her view, charity demands that we aid others, but not at the cost of violating rights to non-interference, or negative rights. As Foot puts it, “in so far as a man’s charity is limited only by his justice… he is not less than perfect in charity” (1983 [MD 57]). But what does justice require? For Foot, answering this question depends on determining the scope of our moral rights, a project she pursued through reflection on a series of thought experiments, some of which have since entered popular culture.

Consider a pair of scenarios that Foot calls Rescue I and Rescue II (1984 [MD 80]). In both cases, we are to imagine ourselves driving a jeep along a seashore and have the opportunity to save stranded people from an incoming tide. In the Rescue I, we are about to save one person when we notice five others whom we can instead save, though we cannot save both groups. In Rescue II, we can save the five only by running over one person and killing him. Foot believes there is a morally significant difference between these cases. She maintains that it is impermissible to save the five in Rescue II, whereas it is at least permissible to save the five in Rescue I.

On Foot’s view, the crucial difference is that saving the five in Rescue II requires initiating a fatal causal sequence, while in Rescue I, we merely allow a deadly sequence that we did not initiate to continue. This is not to say that allowing deadly sequences to run their course is always permissible, or that the distinction between doing and allowing invariably determines the moral status of an action. The claim is only that the distinction sometimes makes a morally significant difference, as it does in these cases. According to Foot, “it takes more to justify an interference than to justify the withholding of goods and services” (1984 [MD 83]). At the very least, this implies that it is impermissible to kill one person to save another.[5]

Foot also has in mind here the distinction between negative and positive rights. Negative rights are rights to non-interference, while positive rights impose obligations to provide aid or services. Negative rights prohibit others from initiating a fatal causal sequence, whereas positive rights may generate obligations to prevent such sequences from continuing. Foot contends that negative rights carry greater weight than positive rights.

In “The Problem of Abortion and the Doctrine of Double Effect” (1967), Foot introduces a related case that has since become the subject of extensive discussion: a runaway trolley is headed toward five people who will be killed, but it can be diverted onto a track on which there is only one person (1967 [VV 23]). Intuitively, it seems permissible to turn the trolley and thereby kill one person to save five. The problem is that it does not seem similarly permissible to kill one to save five in cases such as Rescue II. Why, Foot asks, can we not defend the permissibility of killing one to save five in those cases by appealing to the trolley case?

As we have seen, Foot argues that negative rights are generally stronger than positive rights. In Rescue II, one must violate a person’s negative rights in order to satisfy the positive claims of others, and this is impermissible because the priority of negative rights is not outweighed by the needs of the five. In the trolley case, by contrast, the situation does not involve violating negative rights to satisfy positive rights. Rather, the negative rights of the five stand opposed to the negative rights of the one, and either course of action will violate someone’s rights. In such a case, Foot argues, it is preferable to minimize the violation of negative rights by turning the trolley (1967 [VV 27]).

On Foot’s view, we are generally not permitted to do something to another person that interferes with their negative rights. For example, we may not steal someone’s property, though we may not be required actively to secure their continued possession of it; that is, we may allow them to lose it. Foot thereby defends a principle that draws a moral distinction between doing and allowing. She also defends a version of the doctrine of double effect, according to which it is sometimes permissible to bring about a result that one foresees as a consequence of one’s action but does not intend, even though it would be impermissible to aim at that same result either as a means or as an end (1985 [MD 91]).

Foot believes this doctrine is important because the distinction between doing and allowing does not capture every morally significant difference. Consider a case in which we possess a drug, but only enough either to cure one person suffering from a fatal condition or to save five others suffering from a milder, though still fatal, form of the same illness. In such a case, it is permissible to give the drug to the five. If we could save all six, we surely would. Clearly, we do not intend the death of the one, even though we foresee it as a consequence of our action. By contrast, it is impermissible to withhold a life-saving drug from one person to use his organs to save five after he dies. Here, the death of the one is an essential means to the achievement of the end, and so is strictly intended. Although in this case one allows a person to die rather than directly killing him, the action is nevertheless impermissible. According to Foot, only the doctrine of double effect adequately explains the moral difference between these cases.

At the same time, Foot does not think the doctrine of double effect can stand on its own; it must be supplemented by the distinction between doing and allowing. After all, one may impermissibly initiate harm even when the harmful result is only indirectly intended. Foot gives the example of merchants who knowingly sell poisoned oil. Their aim is not to harm their customers but to turn a profit, yet they nevertheless initiate a harmful causal sequence.

These principles systematize a non-consequentialist “common morality,” and Foot puts them to work in her discussions of abortion and euthanasia. She is skeptical of attempts to resolve the abortion debate without first settling the question of whether, and at what point, the fetus possesses moral rights, a question she regards as intractable (1984 [MD 87]). In this respect, she opposes Judith Jarvis Thomson, who famously argued that some abortions are permissible even if, for the sake of argument, the fetus is granted full moral status. Thomson illustrates her position with the well-known violinist thought experiment. Imagine that, while we sleep, a group of music lovers secretly connects us to a famous violinist suffering from a fatal ailment, and that only our body can keep him alive during the roughly nine months required for his recovery (Thomson 1971: 48). The question is whether we may permissibly detach ourselves, thereby causing his death. Thomson argues that we may, since our negative rights have been violated and no one has the right to use another person’s body, even to save his own life. Of course, the analogy is limited to cases of non-consensual impregnation, such as pregnancies resulting from rape.

Foot argues that Thomson’s analogy suffers from a devastating flaw. There is, she claims, a morally significant difference between disconnecting someone from one’s body and performing an abortion. In the violinist case, disconnecting the violinist does not initiate a fatal causal sequence, since he was already in the grip of a fatal condition before being attached to us. Abortion, by contrast, does initiate such a sequence. Foot therefore takes abortion to resemble Rescue II, whereas disconnecting the violinist resembles Rescue I. As she puts it:

the fetus is not in jeopardy because it is in its mother’s womb; it is merely dependent on her in the way children are dependent on their parents for food. (1984 [MD 87])

Rejecting Thomson’s attempt to show that some abortions are permissible even if the fetus has full moral status, Foot’s considered position is that the permissibility of abortion ultimately turns on precisely the issue Thomson seeks to bracket. On this question, Foot rather surprisingly appears to retreat from her earlier commitment to objectivity, claiming that whether the fetus counts as a human being is, in some sense, a matter for communities to decide (1970 [MD 7]).

Perhaps Foot’s most penetrating article in applied ethics is “Euthanasia” (1977). Foot defines euthanasia as a killing carried out for the good of the person killed, and asks whether such an act can ever be permissible. One central question is whether it can ever be good for a person to be deprived of life, and thus one of Foot’s primary aims is to determine what kind of thing a good human life is. She rejects the narrowly hedonistic view that the value of life is determined by the balance of pleasure over pain that it promises. In her view, life may remain good for someone who is suffering and likely to continue suffering. Yet she also argues that mere continued existence in the absence of suffering is not itself a good (1977 [VV 42]). What matters, on her account, is a recognizably human life containing at least a minimum of “basic human goods,” including:

that a man is not driven to work far beyond his capacity; that he has the support of a family or community; that he can more or less satisfy his hunger; that he has hopes for the future; that he can lie down to rest at night. (Ibid.)

In the absence of such goods, Foot argues, life is no longer a good for the person living it.

The permissibility of euthanasia, then, turns on questions of justice and charity (1977 [VV 44]). In Foot’s view, even when it would be better for someone not to survive, we must still respect that person’s rights. Hence, involuntary active euthanasia is never permissible. By contrast, the right to assistance in remaining alive ordinarily appeals to the charity of others rather than to justice, except where special obligations exist, as in the case of a doctor who has a contractual duty to sustain a patient’s life. Yet even in such cases, a patient’s claim on assistance is limited both by the claims of others and by consideration for the patient’s own well-being. There may come a point at which the measures available to prolong a patient’s life no longer confer any real benefit. In such circumstances, Foot argues, it is neither unjust nor uncharitable for a doctor to withhold treatment, and she notes that such forms of passive euthanasia are already widely practiced (1977 [VV 56]). However, Foot also argues that it may sometimes be permissible not to prolong the life even of someone who wishes to continue living. She gives the example of a dying soldier whose life could be extended by a certain drug, but only at the cost of a prolonged death by starvation. In such a case, Foot maintains, nonvoluntary passive euthanasia is permissible.

Of course, the central controversy concerns whether voluntary active euthanasia is permissible. Foot rejects James Rachels’ claim that permitting passive euthanasia commits one, on grounds of consistency, to permitting active euthanasia in similar circumstances because the latter is often “more humane” (Rachels 1975). She argues by analogy that it may be more humane to deprive someone of property that is bringing harm to him, while nevertheless holding that taking it away would violate justice (1977 [VV 50]). On the other hand, a person may authorize the destruction of his own property, and as Foot concludes:

If someone gives you permission to destroy his property it can no longer be said that you have no right to do so, and I do not see why it should not be the same with taking a man’s life. (1977 [VV 53])

Nevertheless, Foot admits that the moral issue is not exhausted by considerations of rights. It does not follow that an action is morally unobjectionable simply because it violates no one’s rights. The remaining question is whether death would genuinely be good for the person and hence compatible with charity. This excludes cases in which someone wishes to die because they fear becoming a burden on others while facing a life of dependency. In such circumstances, other things being equal, death would not be for that person’s good. Foot also expresses broader concerns about the practice of euthanasia, which makes her reluctant to advocate for its wider legalization.

5. Virtue and Morality

In her discussions of abortion and euthanasia, Foot appeals repeatedly to the virtues of charity and justice. The virtues, therefore, play a central role in her conception of morality. On Foot’s account, a virtue has three essential features. First, it is a disposition of the will. Second, it is beneficial to its possessor and to others, or simply to others. Third, it corrects some bad or dangerous tendency characteristic of human beings generally.

Foot begins her investigation of the connection between virtue and the will by examining the role of intention in the assessment of character. In her view, we evaluate a person’s moral quality primarily through their intentions (1978 [VV 4]). Yet good intentions alone are not sufficient to establish that someone possesses virtue. In the case of charity or benevolence, a person may reveal a lack of charity despite having good intentions if they fail to bring about the intended good. One may, for example, be ignorant of something one ought to know, as Foot famously illustrates through the example of failing to learn basic first aid. Someone who is genuinely benevolent will take the trouble to acquire such knowledge, and because it is both easily attained and generally useful to others, failing to acquire it reveals a deficiency in charity. Foot also argues that failures of performance may count against a person’s claim to virtue even where their intentions are good, especially when their “heart is not in” the action. The virtues are therefore also “dispositions of the heart,” in Foot’s sense, which means that one must cultivate the desire to act well. Conversely, virtue in the fullest sense belongs to someone who is “prompt and resourceful” in doing good (Ibid.). A virtuous person takes pleasure in benefiting others, and so Foot’s conception of the will includes not only intentions, but also what she calls our “innermost desires.”

There are, of course, important qualifications to add here. It is surely not always within our power to alter our emotions and desires; indeed, whether such change is possible in particular cases remains an open empirical and psychological question (Hursthouse 1999: 113–119). Still, Foot’s central claim is conceptual: we are charitable when our intentions and desires, insofar as they fall under the control of the will, dispose us to act for the good of others with ease and pleasure. If, because of a psychological condition unresponsive to treatment, a person cannot take joy in helping others, this does not count against their possession of virtue. Indeed, Foot suggests that such circumstances increase “the virtue that is needed if a man is to act well” (1978 [VV 14]). Care is needed here, however, since Foot does not mean that a person facing such difficulties is necessarily more virtuous than someone who does not. Nevertheless, conditions such as depression may test a person’s virtue in distinctive ways. Their onset may lead someone to fail where an equally virtuous person not subject to such conditions would succeed. More generally, some individuals find themselves in psychological or social circumstances that place greater demands on their commitment to goodness.[6] This means that those who have a relatively easy time acting courageously or benevolently simply have not had their commitment to goodness tested in the same way as someone who faces these psychological obstacles. Those who face such obstacles must show more virtue, though they are not necessarily more virtuous than those in more ideal circumstances.

The virtue of wisdom presents a further challenge for Foot’s account of the connection between virtue and the will. Unlike the other virtues, wisdom appears primarily to be an excellence of the intellect rather than of the will. Yet Foot argues that the intellectual character of a putative virtue does not show that the will is irrelevant to it. In her view, wisdom has two components. First, it involves knowledge of the all-purpose means to general good ends. She includes among such ends “friendship, marriage, the bringing up of children, or the choice of ways of life” (1978 [VV 5]). According to Foot, this sort of knowledge lies within the reach of any moral agent sufficiently concerned to acquire it. One need not possess exceptional intelligence or uncommon circumstances to attain it. In this respect, wisdom differs from specialized scientific knowledge, which may be accessible only to those fortunate enough to possess the requisite talents and opportunities. The knowledge involved in wisdom, therefore, falls within the scope of the will: we can acquire it if we care enough to do so, and can accordingly be evaluated for success or failure in attaining it.

The second part of wisdom, according to Foot, consists of knowing the worth of particular ends. Here she has in mind the knowledge involved in realizing that a life spent in the pursuit of wealth or fame at the expense of good relationships is, in fact, a wasted life. This aspect of virtue is a matter of forming judgments about what is worthwhile in life, and she thinks one can be mistaken about these matters. This raises the question of how this can be a matter under the control of one’s will. Yet Foot believes that there is a connection with the will here as well, stating,

Wisdom in this second part is … to be described in terms of apprehension, and even judgement, but since it has to do with a man’s attachments it also characterises his will. (1978 [VV 7])

In other words, the knowledge involved here requires underlying virtues that are straightforwardly a matter of the will. Thus, there is a case that the moral virtues, including wisdom, are virtues of the will broadly construed.[7]

The second feature of virtues is that they are beneficial. As mentioned above, Foot argues in her early work that the virtues necessarily benefit their possessors. But in her middle period, she abandons that view in favor of one in which the virtues are beneficial “in some general way” (1978 [VV 2]). Some virtues, such as courage, temperance, and wisdom, benefit both their possessors and others. Others, including charity and justice, may at times benefit only others, since they can require extreme sacrifice from those who possess them (1978 [VV 3]). Justice, as Foot observes, presents the greatest difficulty for the claim that the virtues necessarily benefit their possessors (1978 [VV xv, 3]). Yet it is also unclear whether justice necessarily benefits others in any particular case. There are surely circumstances in which we could benefit someone by infringing another person’s rights, just as there are cases in which we could greatly benefit many people only by violating the rights of one. The demands of justice may therefore require us to forgo benefits that we could otherwise confer on others. Nevertheless, Foot appears to think that a society composed of just individuals is generally beneficial for those living within it. As she writes:

communities where justice and charity are lacking are apt to be wretched places to live, as Russia was under the Stalinists, or Sicily under the Mafia. (1978 [VV 3])

In this qualified sense, then, the virtues are good in that they are beneficial.

Foot then turns to the question of whether virtue always results in good action and, in “Virtues and Vices” (1978), answers in the affirmative. One difficulty is to account for the appearance that someone who is engaging in a bad action may still exhibit a virtue. She gives the example of a fearless murderer. It may seem that a fearless murderer is courageous, but Foot thinks that the appearance is misleading. She allows that we may be inclined to say that an act ‘took courage’ or to speak of the ‘courage of the murderer,’ but we still resist calling it a ‘courageous act’ or an ‘act of courage.’ In “Von Wright on Virtue” (1989), Foot adds that we may be willing to describe an action as an ‘act of courage’ in cases where

the evil end is distant from the action concerned, as when, for instance, a man does something to save his own life or that of his companions in the course of some wicked enterprise, such as an unjust war. (1989 [MD 114])

She believes this implies that courage is more than mere mastery of fear; instead, it is mastery of fear exhibited in the pursuit of good ends. Courage, therefore, overlaps with traits such as daring and boldness, but it is not identical with them, since those traits may exist independently of any commitment to goodness. She concludes that mastery of fear is necessary for courage, but not sufficient for it.

If her arguments are sound, Foot establishes an important connection between virtue and moral goodness, but it may not yet be clear that virtue is necessary for being a good human being. Foot argues that the virtues are needed as correctives to general human characteristics that make it difficult for us to act well. Because we are susceptible to excessive fear or appetites, it seems clear that courage and temperance are necessary correctives. Likewise, we are generally subject to deficiencies of motivation to help others or protect their rights due to the fact that we are generally not as attached to the well-being and rights of others as we are to our own (1978 [VV 9]). Of course, these are general tendencies and need not be exhibited in individual cases (1978 [VV 10]). As noted above, some individuals might find it relatively easy to exhibit certain virtues, yet this is just an aspect of the circumstances of their lives. It counts neither for nor against their possession of virtue, nor is it relevant to whether the virtues make one good qua human.

Since no disposition of the will can count as a virtue unless it is a corrective, according to Foot’s view in her middle period, “everything is seen to depend on what human nature is like” (1978 [VV 10]). She clearly believes that the traditional cardinal virtues (courage, temperance, justice, charity, and wisdom) deserve a place among the virtues as she construes them. Still, she admits:

It is possible… that the traditional list of the virtues and vices puts too much emphasis on hedonistic and sensual impulses and does not sufficiently take account of less straightforward inclinations such as the desire to be put upon and dissatisfied, or the unwillingness to accept good things as they come along. (Ibid.)

Our theory of human nature must be taken into account in our moral theorizing, and we must acknowledge as well that our theory of human nature is open to revision.

In Foot’s view, the goodness of the virtues extends beyond moral goodness; for example, she argues that one may show courage in confronting something fearsome for the sake of one’s own life (1989 [MD 115]). The idea here, which she develops in her later work, is that one does not act well in neglecting one’s own interests, just as one who neglects the rights or well-being of others is defective. Human goodness encompasses more than moral goodness, and the virtues are connected with human goodness broadly understood.

It should be noted that, although Foot made significant contributions to the development of neo-Aristotelian virtue theory, she explicitly disavowed allegiance to virtue ethics (RG 2). Her reasons for distancing herself from virtue ethics are not entirely clear. Still, one possible source of disagreement is that, although she regarded the virtues as important to morality, she denied that morality could simply be derived from the virtues themselves. In her view, morality consists in part of a system of rights and duties that is to be determined through an idealized contractual moral code. Hence, she expresses sympathy for the attempts of John Rawls and T. M. Scanlon to develop contractualist approaches to morality (1985 [MD 103]).

6. Ethical Naturalism in Foot’s Late Writings

In Natural Goodness (2001, NG) and several late essays, Foot develops a distinctive approach to ethical naturalism and advances new positions on problems she addressed throughout her career. This work has generated ongoing discussion.

The central concept in Foot’s late ethical naturalism is natural normativity. Building on the ideas of her student, Michael Thompson, Foot argues that understanding living things is an irreducibly normative matter. That is, to identify something as an organism is ipso facto to view it from a normative standpoint. We can look at an organism as an ordinary physical system, but doing so is to miss its biological nature. Her argument rests on two central premises: first, grasping something as an organism requires us to situate it against the background of its species, and second, doing so requires us to consider it from a normative perspective. The first premise draws on Michael Thompson’s work on living things. On that account, identifying something as an organism situates it within the ‘wider context’ of its kind. As Thompson puts it:

If a thing is alive, if it is an organism, then some particular vital operations and processes must go on in it from time to time—eating, budding out, breathing, walking, growing, thinking, photosynthesizing. (Thompson 2008: 56)

But these descriptions “go beyond physics” in Elizabeth Anscombe’s phrase (Anscombe 1963: 86). Consider, for example, the case of eating: for an organism to be regarded as eating something, one must take it to be ingesting something normally nutritious for its kind and absorbing it in such a way as to derive nutrition from it. Otherwise, we could not say that we witnessed an organism eating something, but instead we would be observing a fortuitous occurrence in which an organism takes in some material that happens to further its life (Thompson 2008: 54). Only against the background of a life form, which provides a set of norms for understanding the doings of an instance of that form of life, can the activities of an organism be understood as eating or any other vital activity (Thompson 2003).

On this account, all living things exhibit, in different ways, a distinctive form of agency (Thompson 2008: 43). The growth of a fern is fundamentally unlike the growth of a non-living thing such as a puddle of rainwater or a trash heap, since the fern brings about its own growth through processes of cell division. Moreover, we can describe how such growth ought to proceed and recognize when it has gone wrong, whereas there is no comparable sense in which the growth of a trash heap can malfunction. The growth of a fern also differs from that of a rhododendron, even though both exhibit the characteristic agency of living things. We must, in principle, be able to distinguish the growth proper to the fern from a growth on the fern caused by blight, for example, and such discrimination presupposes a conception of how the fern’s life characteristically unfolds.

The vital operations that characterize something as an organism are therefore intelligible only against the background of a life form. A particular organism can be understood only in relation to its species, which defines the characteristic way of life of its members. Identifying something as an organism thus already involves understanding it as functionally organized to pursue its species characteristic ends. Importantly, this is a logical claim about what is involved in identifying something as a living organism. The existence of life forms, in Thompson’s sense, is not a contingent fact about the historical development of presently existing organisms in the way that the existence of genera or phyla is. Whenever we identify something as an organism, whether it is the first or the last of its kind, we already presuppose the existence of a life form. This reflects the logical structure of judgments about living things in that judgments about individuals are tied to judgments about the form of life.

To situate an organism against the background of the characteristic functioning of its kind is to view it from a normative perspective. More precisely, it is to assess the organism in relation to what is normal for members of its species, and thereby to make a normative judgment, or at least to be able to do so. Of course, species admit of many variations, and not every variation found in an individual counts as a defect. As Foot points out, a blue tit may lack the patch of blue on its head without being hindered in carrying out its life activities; such a lack is therefore not a defect (NG 30). Natural normativity thus involves identifying the features and capacities essential to the successful performance of an organism’s vital operations.

To possess this kind of understanding, however, we need only recognize that the organism is functionally organized, which is precisely what occurs when we situate it against the background of its species. This further implies that to regard something as a living organism already involves some grasp, even if mistaken, of its needs as the kind of thing that it is.

Likewise, to understand an individual human being requires us to bring to bear an understanding of the human form of life. Of course, human beings are capable of many different modes of life, and given such diversity, it is reasonable to ask whether there is nevertheless a characteristic human life and a univocal sense of a good human being. Foot acknowledges that our rationality gives us choices in our approach to living that is exceptional among non-human living things. So, she believes this feature of our form of life introduces a “sea change” in how we approach the evaluation of our species. Reasoning, and especially the application of reasoning to action, is itself subject to evaluation in human beings. As Foot writes, “[W]hile [non-human] animals go for the good (thing) that they see, human beings go for what they see as good” (NG 56).

Human beings characteristically respond to reasons in an explicit way, insofar as they act on some conception of what is good. Because human beings can reason about how to act, they are subject to a distinctive form of evaluation. Indeed, it is precisely this application of reason to action that lies at the center of ethical evaluation. Foot argues that the vices are defects in responsiveness to reasons for action and hence constitute a distinctive kind of natural defect in human beings. More specifically, vicious individuals possess defective wills. Unlike many natural defects, which may simply be matters of bad luck, defects of will are attributable to the agent, who can therefore be called to account through moral blame.

So, moral goodness is a form of natural normativity in its application to human beings. That is, moral goodness is an aspect of what makes us good as human beings. The idea is indeed present in some her early writings such as “Goodness and Choice” (1961), where she defends the idea that there are objective features of living things that make them good as members of their species. But natural goodness is the central plank developed in her late work, where she claims that virtue makes humans good in the same way that blight-free, lush green flesh in a certain shape makes a cactus good.

Thus far, this view may appear to ground ethics solely in the very general feature of rationality, abstracting from the other dimensions of human nature. If so, it would seem unable to advance the project of justifying the virtues, since it threatens to collapse into the empty standard of acting in accordance with “right reason.” Yet, as noted above, the appeal to human nature serves not merely to identify us as rational beings, but also to determine what it is to reason well. Neo-Aristotelian ethical naturalism, as Foot develops it, is therefore best understood as a thesis about rationality itself, according to which practical rationality is species-relative. Human reasoning cannot ignore what human beings need and still count as practically rational.

Foot can therefore maintain that, as rational animals, we are liberated from a certain kind of direct obedience to nature, while nevertheless holding that nature retains normative authority over us. Nature is normative for our reasoning, though not directly for our actions (Lott 2012b). Foot claims that human beings pursue what they see as good, rather than simply pursuing the good things they perceive, as non-human animals do. Yet what we take to be good is inevitably shaped by some conception of the human form of life. For the ethical naturalist, making that conception explicit and subjecting it to rational criticism is an essential part of moral reflection and reform.

Foot’s revised conception of the role of human nature in morality leads her to revisit her views on practical rationality. In her final published essay, “Rationality and Goodness” (2004, RG), she discusses the case of a farm boy from the Sudetenland who chose death rather than service in the Nazi SS.[8] In a letter to his family, he writes:

We did not sign up for the SS, and so they condemned us to death. Both of us would rather die than stain our consciences with such deeds of horror. (RG 2; see Gollwitzer et al. 1956)

Reflecting on this case, Foot asks:

Was this a rational choice? On what theory of practical rationality—of the rationality of choices—can this be made out? (RG 2)

Foot believes she has found a new approach capable of vindicating the rationality of the farm boy’s decision, and indeed as a rational choice for any similarly situated human being. This marks a second reversal in her thinking about practical rationality. In her later work, she comes to believe that her middle-period position rested on a mistaken conception of reasons for action. That earlier view was a form of instrumentalism, according to which genuine reasons for action derive from the satisfaction of desires or the advancement of interests.

Foot eventually came to think that such theories face a serious objection articulated by Warren Quinn. Quinn argues that instrumentalist theories permit a form of rational shamelessness. If rationality simply requires agents to maximize the satisfaction of their preferences or interests, regardless of the content of those preferences, then agents with vicious or cruel desires are rationally required to pursue them effectively (Quinn 1994: 216). This sits uneasily with the idea that rationality is supposed to be a sort of master virtue.

Foot proposes that we abandon the demand that moral action conform to some antecedently specified conception of practical rationality, such as a desire-satisfaction theory. Instead, she argues that moral considerations should be understood as one among several kinds of considerations that generate reasons for action to which rational agents must respond (NG 11). If practical rationality is to serve both as an authoritative guide to action and as a virtue, then it requires sensitivity to moral considerations. Whether practical rationality requires such sensitivity is plainly relevant to whether it qualifies as a genuine virtue, much less as a master virtue. Our standards of rationality should derive from our standards for goodness of will, rather than vice versa. On this view, practical rationality must be situated within a broader conception of human good.

Foot believes that ordinary judgments about foolish action already reflect such an approach. We commonly regard someone who jeopardizes her future for the sake of a trivial and passing desire as behaving irrationally. As Foot writes:

Being unable to fit the supposed ‘reason’ into some preconceived present-desire-based theory of reasons for action, we do not query whether it really is a foolish way to behave, but rather hang onto the evaluation and shape our theory of reasons accordingly. (NG 63)

Moral reasons, however, are not the only considerations to which rational agents must respond. Foot holds that moral considerations, such as those arising from justice and charity, stand alongside considerations of self-interest and desire-fulfillment. She also maintains that family and friendship constitute additional and irreducible sources of reasons for action (RG 8–9). Judgments about what it is rational to do therefore require weighing a plurality of considerations, and Foot concludes: “It is not always rational to give help where it is needed, to keep a promise, or even… always to speak the truth” (NG 11). Moral reasons are therefore not invariably overriding. A soldier, for example, may permissibly lie to save himself while in enemy hands (RG 7). Even considerations of desire-fulfillment may sometimes outweigh moral considerations, as when a trivial promise is overridden by an unexpected opportunity to fulfill a long-cherished desire.

For the case of the Sudetenland farm boy, the result of Foot’s view is that we need not demonstrate that his decision to embrace death rather than serve the Nazis is in his best interest or serves his strongest desires. Of course, there is a certain sense in which he would rather die than serve the Nazis, but, as Foot points out, he need not lack a strong desire to live for his action to count as rational. As she writes:

If, according to a particular theory of rationality, a good action such as his seems dubiously rational, then so much the worse, not for the judgment, but rather for the theory. (RG 6)

She returns to the view that there are different sets of considerations that can justify and explain actions. In her early work, Foot apparently appeals to intuitions about what we count as reasons for action, though in her late work she adds to this account a framework for assessing which considerations possess this independent rationalizing status. She believes that the human will must be assessed against the background of facts concerning human life, especially against facts about what humans need. As Foot puts it, “the evaluation of human action depends… on essential features of specifically human life” (NG 14). On Foot’s view, then, our conception of practical rationality is inevitably tied to what is good for human beings, and must answer to facts concerning what is good for human beings as a species. We must take certain facts about the human condition into account and then we will see that these facts provide the basis for a case in favor of virtues, including, most importantly for Foot, justice and charity.

However, it is important to realize that Foot is not saying that our understanding of good human reasoning is to be based on a morally neutral, biological notion of flourishing. There is a straightforward misreading of Foot’s naturalism that misconstrues what is natural about Foot’s naturalism (Andreou 2006). These readings take Foot to argue that moral goodness is crucial for human survival and reproduction.

Foot argues that ethical naturalism need not define the aim of practical reasoning in terms of promoting what an individual needs for survival and reproduction in a narrow biological sense, and she explicitly states that she is not doing so. Rather, she believes that we inevitably possess an understanding of what makes for a good human life that informs our understanding of good human reasoning, good human action, and good human character in general. Structurally, this is analogous to how parts of a plant are deemed good with reference to the flourishing of a plant. But Foot does not mean to suggest that the content of norms of governing human reasoning and character must be pegged to a notion of lush-green-leaves-and-deep-roots flourishing as adapted to human terms. Certainly, there are norms governing our assessment of human health, but there are also norms specifying how events are supposed to proceed when we reason and act, and these norms cannot be equated with what promotes human health, survival or reproduction, except insofar as these are rationally chosen by humans. We do not hold survival and reproduction as sacrosanct values and therefore it is not always rationally chosen. We see this reflected by the fact that justice and other virtues may require us to forgo having children, or even to lay down our lives. Foot clearly has these points in mind when she says:

Lack of capacity to reproduce is a defect in a human being. But choice of childlessness and even celibacy is not thereby shown to be defective choice, because human good is not the same as plant or animal good. (NG 42)

As noted above, Foot’s later ethical naturalism has generated extensive controversy (see Hähnel 2020 and Jordan 2026 for overviews). As we have just seen, Foot emphasizes that the evaluation of human reasoning, choice, and action is not something discoverable through empirical investigation. As Micah Lott has argued, this suggests that her version of ethical naturalism affirms the autonomy of ethics (2020), namely, the view that ethics cannot be reduced to some non-ethical subject matter. Of course, some versions of ethical naturalism, such as that defended by Nicholas Sturgeon, also affirm the autonomy of ethics. On Sturgeon’s view, ethics is an independent empirical inquiry that is not reducible to the other empirical sciences (see Sturgeon 2003), even though it nevertheless identifies natural facts.

Lott argues further, however, that Foot’s position is at least compatible with the claim that successful practical reasoning apprehends irreducible normative facts, a central thesis of moral non-naturalism. If so, Aristotelian naturalism would be compatible with moral non-naturalism, a possibility earlier noted by Jonathan Dancy (2006). Still, there may be grounds for interpreting Foot as rejecting irreducible normative facts. As Parisa Moosavi argues, what is distinctive about Foot’s naturalism is precisely its emphasis on human beings as part of the natural biological order (2022a). On this reading, it would conflict with Foot’s position to suppose that practical reasoning reaches out to a distinct non-natural realm of normative facts. Rather, sound ethical reasoning tracks what it is to be good qua human being, understood as a living thing with a distinctive capacity for practical rationality. Moosavi therefore argues that Foot’s view constitutes a bona fide form of ethical naturalism even if ethics itself is not reducible to empirical scientific investigation.

Another major area of debate concerns whether Foot’s view is compatible with contemporary biology (FitzPatrick 2000; Odenbaugh 2017; Lewens 2020). Much of this discussion centers on the framework of natural normativity, which treats organisms and relatively stable life forms as explanatorily fundamental, rather than privileging entities such as genes that change over time through natural selection. Defenders of Foot and Michael Thompson argue that empirical biology itself presupposes the logical framework they describe. On this view, there is no cognitive access to living things as such apart from the kind of life-form judgments Thompson analyzes. The claim is therefore that life forms are logically necessary categories rather than merely empirical heuristics, as Tim Lewens argues. Moreover, defenders maintain that Thompson’s framework both grounds and coexists with empirical biology without conflict (Hacker-Wright 2009, 2012, 2021; Lott 2012a; Lockhart and Lott 2024).

These ongoing debates suggest that the position has come to occupy a significant place in contemporary ethical theory.

Bibliography

Primary Sources

When abbreviations are used to cite Foot’s works in the text, the abbreviation begins the bibliographic item below.

Foot’s principal essays are collected in the following two volumes.

  • [MD] Moral Dilemmas and Other Topics in Moral Philosophy, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002. doi:10.1093/019925284X.001.0001. Includes:
    • 1970, “Morality and Art”, Proceedings of the British Academy, 56: 131–144; reprinted MD, 5–19.
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  • [NG] Natural Goodness, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001. doi:10.1093/0198235089.001.0001

Individual papers cited in the text:

  • [RG] “Rationality and Goodness” in Modern Moral Philosophy, (Royal Institute of Philosophy Supplement 54), Anthony O’Hear (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004: 1–14. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511550836.002
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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Acknowledgments

Parts of this entry are adapted with significant revisions from my book Philippa Foot’s Moral Thought (London: Bloomsbury 2013).

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John Hacker-Wright <jhackerw@uoguelph.ca>

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