The Cyrenaics

First published Tue Mar 31, 2026

The Cyrenaics are one of the so-called Socratic schools, namely schools which, according to the doxographical tradition, were founded by prominent figures of the Socratic circle, were active during the Hellenistic period each under the leadership of a succession of scholarchs, and advanced different or even diametrically opposed interpretations of Socrates’ philosophical ideas and interests. Unlike the Cynics, however, whose connection to their alleged founder, Antisthenes the Socratic, is tenuous and whose succession is an artificial construction of the doxographers, the Cyrenaics have a solid Socratic pedigree. Not only is it well attested that Aristippus of Cyrene (born c. 435 BCE) was a close associate of Socrates, but also the school that he founded after Socrates’ death was headed in turn by himself, his daughter Arete, and his grandson, Aristippus the Younger or the Mother-taught, who, according to the doxographical tradition, is the leader of the mainstream branch of the school. While hostile authors represent Aristippus of Cyrene as an amoral voluptuary, our most reliable sources attest that he was a man of many gifts and talents, who defended core Socratic values and integrated them successfully into his distinctive philosophical outlook. And although it is the doctrine articulated by his grandson which came to be viewed as Cyrenaic orthodoxy, clear lines can be traced between the epistemology and ethics of Aristippus the Younger and the positions and values defended by the founder of the school. Likewise, distinctions can be drawn between, on the one hand, the mainstream doctrine of Aristippus the Younger and his followers and, on the other, the views of each of the three Cyrenaic sects active during the Hellenistic period and led, respectively, by Theodorus, Hegesias, and Anniceris. Their theoretical differences notwithstanding, however, these latter as well as the mainstream sect of Aristippus the Younger share common ground, exhibit family resemblances, and their philosophies evoke, each in its own way, some of the Socratic values illustrated in practice by Aristippus of Cyrene and arguably endorsed by Socrates himself.

In antiquity as well as in modernity, the Cyrenaics are associated not only with the Socratic tradition, but also with a different trend of thought. While most Greek philosophers defend versions of metaphysical, epistemological, or ethical realism, the Cyrenaics belong to a minority of Greek thinkers who challenge specific aspects of the realist perspective or might give the impression of rejecting it altogether. Comparable to thinkers such as the historical Protagoras, the “subtler thinkers” speaking in his defense in Plato’s Theaetetus, or the Sceptics, the Cyrenaics turn their attention to the perceiving subject and treat the subjective conditions resulting from the subject’s interaction with the external world as fundamental to our conception of what is real, true, and right or wrong (Betegh & Tsouna forthcoming). According to their central epistemological position, we can only apprehend our own pathê (undergoings, affects) but cannot know anything about what typically causes the pathê, namely objects in the world. A better understanding of that claim and of the ongoing debate concerning the question whether the pathê are equivalent to experiences, or merely natural facts (Everson 1991), or ontologically ambiguous (Burnyeat 1982), can yield a fuller appreciation of the originality of Cyrenaic epistemology and the challenges that it poses.

If the turn inwards is compatible with the spirit of Socrates’ enquiries, the kind of hedonism typically ascribed to the orthodox Cyrenaics exercises considerable strain on their identity as a Socratic school. Although Aristippus of Cyrene was not an ethical hedonist, he ascribed to pleasure far greater value than Plato or any other Socratic did. As for the presentist hedonism articulated by his grandson and presented as the canonical Cyrenaic doctrine, it appears prima facie incompatible with the eudaemonistic ethics of Socrates and his followers. Further worries can be raised in connection with the ethics of the sects headed, respectively, by Anniceris, Hegesias, and Theodorus. More will be said about these topics below, but, at the outset, the point to retain is that, of the so-called Socratic philosophers and their schools, the Cyrenaics seem to be farthest away from the main interests and values animating Socrates and his entourage.

Barring Plato, the Cyrenaics stand out among the other Socratics in another respect as well, namely their reception by both ancient authors and modern interpreters. There is higher level of engagement with their views than is known to be with the views of Antisthenes, Aeschines, Eucleides, Phaedo, and their respective schools, or the philosophical aspects of Xenophon’s writings. In addition to the interactions between the different Cyrenaic sects and between the latter and the Epicureans, Aristippus of Cyrene and the Cyrenaics receive critical attention by authors of the Platonic and Aristotelian tradition, several doxographers, and some of the the Church Fathers. In the modern era, notable cases of reception consist in attempts to revisit controversial aspects of Cyrenaic philosophy in light of contemporary philosophical concerns.

1. The Cyrenaic succession

In accordance with standard practice, the Cyrenaic philosophers are classified by the ancient doxographers in a so-called succession (diadochê), namely a sequence of teacher-pupil relations which begins with the founder and ends with the last known members of the school. Typically, such schemes are artificial constructions linking together a well-known philosophical figure with thinkers belonging to a later period thus transferring to these latter a respectable philosophical pedigree. The Cyrenaic succession is distinct, however, since the first three leaders of the school belong to the same family and hence it seems natural to assume that there is an unmediated connection between the ideas and values of the school’s founder and the philosophical views of two scholarchs that followed him in turn. Whether or how this is true remains to be examined, but we should look, in the first place, at the lines of the Cyrenaic succession traced in the Lives of Diogenes Laertius and in the Suda.

Aristippus, son of Aritades (Suda A 3908), was a native of Cyrene and the undisputed founder of the Cyrenaic school. It is said that all the Cyrenaic philosophers “sprang from him” (D.L. 2.85), even though the later Cyrenaic sects called themselves by the names of their own leaders: Hegesians, Annicerians, and Theodoreans (D.L. 2.85). The immediate disciples of Aristippus were his daughter Arete, Antipater of Cyrene and, possibly, Aethiops of Ptolemaïs (on Aethiops, see Hicks 1925: vol. 1, 215 note b, and Lampe 2015: 18–19). Of them, Arete succeeded her father as head of the school and taught, in her turn, her son Aristippus, who went by the name of Aristippus the Younger or Aristippus the Mother-taught. This Aristippus became the third head of the school and, according to the sources, he taught Theodorus of Cyrene, nicknamed Theodorus the Atheist or Theodorus the God (D.L. 2.86, 100). The followers of Aristippus the Younger became known as Cyrenaics (D.L. 2.86) and presumably showcased themselves as the legitimate heirs of Aristippus and wardens of Cyrenaic orthodoxy, while the disciples of Theodorus pursued, we shall see, a deviant philosophical path.

At the level of the second Cyrenaic generation the succession splits into two strands, one of them headed by Arete who apparently became scholarch, the other led by Antipater of Cyrene, a respected philosopher (Cicero, Tusc. 5.112) and a gifted teacher. According to the succession, Antipater trained a certain Epitemedes—approximate contemporary of Aristippus the Younger—who subsequently taught Paraebates who, in his turn, became the teacher of Hegesias and Anniceris (D.L. 2.86). On this account, the school remains united only under the leadership of its founder but bifurcates immediately afterwards, when Arete takes over as head of the institution. This fact may be accidental or, alternatively, may be due to sexist bias towards Arete or to Antipater’s prestige or both.

While the aforementioned succession suggests a relative chronology of the main Cyrenaic philosophers and sects, this can only be approximate. On most accounts, Aristippus of Cyrene was born c. 435 BCE and joined the Socratic circle in Athens well before Socrates’ trial and execution, possibly between 415 and 410 BCE. If so, his main philosophical activity in Athens, Cyrene, Syracuse and elsewhere, may have taken place between 399 BCE and c. 355 BCE (Giannantoni 1990: vol. 4, 137–139 [nota 13]). On the basis of Aristippus’ dates, Arete was probably born close to the beginning of the fourth century BCE and was active in the first half of that century. It is not known where, when, or for how long she headed the Cyrenaic school, which may have been located in Cyrene or in Athens. There is a similar uncertainty regarding Aristippus the Younger, whose date of birth could be anywhere between c. 390 BCE and 360 BCE and whose floruit is likewise a matter of speculation. There is no doubt, however, that he as well as his mother and grandfather overlapped with most Socratics, including Plato.

The last eponymous pupil of Aristippus the Younger, namely Theodorus, must have been taught by Aristippus in the later years of Aristippus’ life. For Theodorus was born c. 345 BCE and hence would have been too young to have placed himself under philosophical tutelage any time before c. 330 to 320 BCE. Exiled from his native Cyrene, he lived and worked in Athens and later in Alexandria, before returning to Cyrene where he died respected by all sometime in the 250s BCE. According to the Suda (theta 150), he also studied under Pyrrho of Elis (born c. 360 BCE), Bryson of Achaea (a pupil of Stilpo, pupil of Eucleides of Megara—a member of the Socratic circle), and Zeno of Citium (born at 334 BCE). The reliability of these testimonies can be questioned but, nonetheless, they mention philosophers that Theodorus has philosophical affinities with and that were active during his lifetime.

Turning to the branch of the succession originating with Antipater, Antipater’s disciple Epitemedes must have been a near contemporary of Aristippus the Younger, while Epitemedes’ pupil Paraebates was probably close in age to Stilpo (c. 360–280 BCE). For, according to Diogenes Laertius (2.134), Paraebates taught Menedemus of Eretria who, however, left him in order to study with Stilpo. Assuming that Paraebates was born sometime in the 360s, he was a near contemporary of Theophrastus and Diodorus Cronus and his floruit occurred soon after Plato’s death. We have no information about the exact dates of Hegesias and Anniceris. If they were Paraebates’ students, as stated in the succession, a reasonable guess is that they were born in the 340s and flourished in the early Hellenistic period, between 320 BCE and 280 BCE. These dates are compatible with the Suda (alpha 2466), according to which Anniceris lived at the time of Alexander the Great (356–323 BCE), but incompatible with Suda’s further claim (loc. cit.) that Anniceris’ brother Nicoteles taught Posidonius (135 BCE–51 BCE).

The following three Cyrenaic philosophers should also be mentioned. They are not included in the succession, but are known from other sources (see Lampe 2015: 19–20). First, Aristoteles of Cyrene: born sometime in the 360s BCE, he apparently taught in Athens at approximately the same time as Paraebates and, like the latter, lost some of his students to Stilpo of Megara. Then, Dionysius of Heraclea: he was born probably in the 340s and was taught by Heraclides (an Academic), Alexinus (a Megarian philosopher), Menedemus of Eretria, and Zeno of Citium (D.L. 7.166). According to Cicero (Tusc. 2.60; De fin. 5.94), initially Dionysius was a Stoic, but later on he joined the Cyrenaics because he experienced a severe physical affliction and thus became convinced that bodily pain was in truth the greatest evil (Philodemus, Index Stoicorum col. 32). Whether he adhered to the orthodox Cyrenaics or the Annicerians remains unknown, but it is noteworthy that, in addition to the school’s founder, Dionysius was one of two Cyrenaic philosophers accused ad hominem of promiscuousness and self-indulgence. The other of these philosophers is Aristoxenus of Cyrene (Athenaeus, Deipn. 1.7c), if indeed he was a philosopher and not merely a pleasure-loving Cyrenean.

We lingered over the details of the Cyrenaic succession both for historical reasons and because they point to aspects of the identity of the Cyrenaic school. The first thing to note is its extrovert and mobile character. Unlike other Socratic schools whose activity unfolds in Athens or mainland Greece, the Cyrenaics are active from the start in two geographical locations, namely Athens and Cyrene, the former located in the centre but the latter in the periphery of the Greek world. And even though the presence of Aristippus of Cyrene and other Cyrenaic philosophers in Athens is well documented, their ties to their native city were never cut off. In fact, members of the school appear to be active at about the same time in Athens, Cyrene, Alexandria, and elsewhere. On balance, except for Plato’s Academy, the Cyrenaic school comes across as the most cosmopolitan and extrovert of the Socratic schools. Whether this feature is circumstantial or reflects a deliberate choice is a matter for further reflection.

Next, the early bifurcation of the Cyrenaic succession and the emergence of distinct Hellenistic sects suggests that there were serious disagreements within the school in the course of its development. In the subsequent sections, we shall see that these disagreements were related to the interpretation of the founder’s teachings by his daughter and grandson, and we shall be able to identify the principal foci of debate. At present, suffice it to say that the psychological views of Aristippus of Cyrene and the epistemological doctrine commonly attributed to Aristippus the Younger appear to be endorsed by all known members of the school, whereas this is not unqualifiedly true of the presentist hedonism associated with mainstream Cyrenaic ethics.

Furthermore, the teacher-student relationships in the succession suggest that the Cyrenaics tried to retain their putative connection to Socrates and his circle to the very end. Aristippus of Cyrene is shown to interact with Plato, Aeschines, and Antisthenes; Aristippus the Younger had some sort of intellectual relation to Plato; he and Paraebates were taught by Megarian philosophers; Paraebates and Aristoteles of Cyrene lost students to Stilpo of Megara; Paraebates taught Menedemus of Eretria, who subsequently mentored Dionysius of Heraclea; and so on. Generally, on philosophical as well as biographical grounds, the Cyrenaic school is presented as Socratic from its origins to its historical extinction and throughout its reception by later authors. Bearing all this in mind, we shall begin the discussion of Cyrenaic philosophy by looking at the ideas and lifestyle of the school’s founder: Aristippus of Cyrene or alias Aristippus the Socratic.

2. Aristippus of Cyrene and the origins of Cyrenaic philosophy

The evidence on Aristippus is second-hand and chiefly anecdotal, and it reveals relatively little about the facts of his life. He was born to a wealthy family of Cyrene in the second half of the fifth century BCE, received a Greek education, and in his early maturity moved to Athens where he joined Socrates and his friends. After Socrates’ death, he apparently remained in contact with the Socratics, taught philosophy and other subjects for a considerable fee, visited for a while the court of Dionysius in Syracuse, where he allegedly overlapped with Plato and Aeschines, and eventually founded his own school. We begin by considering three main issues, which will serve as entry points to the thought and character of Aristippus and will clarify his connection, on the one hand, to the philosophy of Socrates and, on the other, to the so-called orthodox Cyrenaic doctrine defended by Aristippus the Younger and his followers. First, is Aristippus an ethical hedonist and, if so, of what kind? Second, are his ethical views and his way of life compatible with the Socratic identity attributed to both him and his school? Third, how are his views related to the epistemological stance attributed by reliable sources to Aristippus the Younger or Mother-taught? We shall take up these questions in turn.

Even though the different strands of evidence about Aristippus’ ethics and behaviour should be assessed with due caution (Tsouna-McKirahan 1994), it seems indubitable that pleasure occupied a central place in his thought and life. “He was always talking about pleasure” (quoted in Eusebius, PE 14.18.31) and must have formed his own conception of the nature and significance of pleasure principally through the discussions conducted in the Socratic milieu and reflected in Platonic dialogues such as the Gorgias, the Phaedo, the Republic, or the Philebus. Indeed, the physiological and psychological basis of Cyrenaic philosophy finds parallels in these works. Aristippus calls pleasure and pain pathê—a term that can refer to physical alterations as well as mental states such as affects, which, in modernity, belong to the realm of the mental. The pathê of pleasure and pain are related, respectively, to smooth or rough motions occurring in the soul (D.L. 2.90) or the flesh (Sextus, PH I.215) and “coming forth to consciousness” (D.L. 2.85; Clement, Strom. 2.20.106).

While the occasional passage suggests that the aforementioned motions are identical with pleasure or pain (Suda, 2.553.4–5), there is firm evidence that, in fact, Aristippus distinguished the smooth or rough motions giving rise to pleasure and pain from the corresponding pleasurable or painful experiences (D.L. 2.85; Clement, Strom. 2.20.106) and intimated that a causal connection obtains between the former and the latter. On his view, pleasure and pain qualify as pathê only because and only in so far as we are conscious of them. He is not known to have talked about pathê other than pleasure and pain. Nonetheless, his conception of these latter probably applied, more generally, to physiological changes occurring in oneself and crossing the threshold of consciousness. Importantly, Aristippus appears to think of pathê as subjective in a fairly uncontroversial sense of that term. Namely, whether they are described as physical motions or as experiences, they are ontologically dependent on the perceiving subject and belong only to that subject. Thus, attention is drawn to the special connection between the affect and the person affected, even though, so far as we know, Aristippus did not explore further its implications.

Another important aspect of Aristippus’ conception of pleasure, which will become prominent in the mainstream ethics of the school, is that pleasure is monochronos—a term probably coined by him and usually, if mistakenly, rendered by “momentary” or “short-lived”. In fact, “monochronos”, unitemporal, seems intended to convey the unity and singularity of pleasure as well as its transient character (Tsouna 1998: 15–17). Every pleasure remains one and the same pleasure for as long as one is experiencing it (unity condition). And while that pleasure is being experienced, it is confined within the present and is not related to the other temporal modes (singularity condition). Taken together, these features indicate that, whether a pleasure lasts for a longer or a shorter time, it can be enjoyed only during its actual occurrence and has no prospective or retrospective value at all (Athenaeus, Deipn. 12.544a-b). This view has parallels in the writings of other Socratics and underpins Aristippus’ admonition to concentrate our attention on the day and our present activities, leaving aside concerns about the past and the future.

Only the present is ours, while what has already happened or what is still anticipated are not ours; for one has perished, and it is uncertain whether the other will occur. (Aelian, VH 14.6; on the reliability of Aelian’s testimony as opposed to Athenaeus’ presentation of Aristippus as a presentist, see Lampe 2015: 64–73, and Wolfsdorf 2013: 20–3)

According to Aelian, Aristippus is not making a theoretical point but is recommending a mental exercise: train yourselves to focus on the present, because of the irrevocability of the past and the uncertainty of the future. In this way, he says, we can attain “cheerfulness and a joyful mind”.

Aristippus’ focus on present pleasure, however, caused both ancient authors and modern interpreters to pigeonhole him either as an ethical hedonist positing present pleasure as the telos, moral goal, or, more rarely, as a eudaemonistic hedonist claiming that happiness understood as the collection of particular pleasures is the supreme good. Thus, on the one hand, certain ancient authors consider Aristippus a presentist because of his conception of pleasure as a pathos lasting only as long as it is experienced. These authors include Athenaeus (Deipn. 12.544a-b), parts of the doxography in Diogenes Laertius, who relays that “Aristippus posits as the telos the smooth motion resulting in sensation” (D.L. 2.85), and Lactantius, whose accusation that Aristippus lived like an animal (see Gysembergh 2016: 40–41) and that he aimed to subjugate man to the yoke of bodily pleasure (Divin.instit. 3.8.6–10, Epit. 28.3) could point to presentism. On the other hand, authors presenting Aristippus as a eudaemonistic hedonist include, first of all, Xenophon, who attributes to Aristippus the goal of “living as easily and pleasantly as possible” (Mem. 2.1.9). Cicero repeatedly presents Aristippus as a eudaemonistic hedonist positing pleasure as the greatest good and pain as the greatest evil (Acad. 2.42.131; Tusc. 2.6.15). Late Epicurean authors, such as Philodemus of Gadara and Diogenes of Oinoanda, follow that same line, if only for polemical purposes. Notwithstanding differences in focus and context, all aforementioned authors assume that Aristippus’ hedonism is normative and determines his way of life. That is, he pursues pleasure because he believes it to be the only good intrinsically worth pursuing, whereas his attitude towards the virtues, personal and social relations, and philosophy itself shows that he considers them means to that end.

In truth, these are misperceptions contradicted by the bulk of the evidence on Aristippus. Most of the stories illustrating his attitudes, activities, and lifestyle show that he did not consider pleasure as the only thing having intrinsic value nor happiness as a collection exclusively and exhaustively consisting of particular pleasures. Rather he shared many of the values prevalent in the Socratic circle and made the enjoyment of pleasure conditional on those values. According to Eusebius (PE 14.18.31), whose information is drawn from the Peripatetic philosopher Aristocles of Messene, it is not Aristippus’ ethical hedonism that dictated his behaviour but rather the converse: his luxurious lifestyle and his conversations were such as to make others suspect that he posited living pleasurably as the telos. Also other sources confirm that, while Aristippus was more pleasure-loving than his fellow Socratics, he did not pursue pleasure unconditionally as the only genuine good. Likewise, even though he considered pain as a great evil and developed mental strategies to mitigate its devastating effects (see Cicero, Tusc. 3.28–35 and the analyses by Graver 2002, O’Keefe 2002, and Warren 2014: 203), he did not think of pain as the only evil nor as the worst possible harm. The question lingers, however, how can Aristippus’ predilection for pleasure be reconciled with his endorsement of Socratic values and his allegiance to Socrates and his circle. In the end, does he really qualify as a Socratic and, if so, on what grounds?

Several anecdotes show Aristippus as being under Socrates’ spell and as spending his time “studying the man and his teachings” (Plutarch, De curios. 2 [516c]). He shared Socrates’ conception of philosophy, wrote dialogues on Socratic themes (on the authenticity of his writings see Mannebach: 1961 fragments 76–85, Giannantoni 1990: vol. 4, 155–168 [nota 16]; Lampe 2015: 17–18), and talked about the value of philosophical education, the importance of virtue, the conditional worth of external goods, and moral luck. Methodologically, Aristippus is represented as familiar with the rules and practice of Socratic dialectic. In a conversation relayed by Xenophon, he plays in turn the rôle of the answerer and that of the questioner (Mem. 3.8.1), forestalls some of Socrates’ moves, uses counterexamples to show that something that has the property F is also not-F (Mem. 3.8.2), asks for necessary clarifications, and appears cooperative and eager to learn from the elenchus. Plutarch (De prof. in virt. 80b) confirms Aristippus’ ability to conduct dialectical investigations in the proper spirit: what he seeks is not victory, but improvement in understanding. Moving on to Aristippus’ activities as an educator, the fact that he receives fees for his services does not disqualify him as a Socratic, as hostile authors suggest (D.L. 2.65). Other Socratics too received payment and, in any case, Aristippus justifies that practice by referring to Socratic ideals, namely the immense value of philosophical education, its decisive contribution to the development of the student’s personality, and the cultivation of the sort of wisdom leading to happiness (D.L. 2.72, Plutarch, Lib.ed. 7 [4f]). In his view, philosophy uniquely and essentially contributes to the care of the soul (D.L. 2.71), the acquisition of self-knowledge, and one’s moral growth through theoretical reflection as well as practical training (anonymous, Gnom. Vat. 743 n. 34). For these reasons, the services of a philosophical teacher ought to be recognised and compensated accordingly.

Like Plato’s Socrates, Aristippus believes that a good education in philosophy is bound to shape one’s character, attitudes, and lifestyle. Also, comparably to Socrates, he shows courage when this is needed and speaks bravely and without fear to everyone alike, regardless of their power or station in life (D.L. 2.68, 73). Like Plato, Antisthenes, and other Socratics, he cares for justice, stresses the importance of following the law, and believes that “kingship differs from tyranny as much as law differs from lawlessness and freedom from slavery” (Stobaeus, Strom. 4.8.18). Moreover, anecdotes usually taken to show that Aristippus is a cynical voluptuary illustrate, in fact, his self-understanding and self-mastery. He says, for instance, that philosophers are like doctors, who are both aware of their own ailments and capable of treating the sick (D.L. 2.69–70). Importantly, he considers temperance a precondition for enjoying pleasure without running the risk of becoming enslaved to it (Stobaeus, Strom. 3.17.17). The famous saying “I possess Laïs but am not possessed by her” drives that point home, as do several other stories illustrating Aristippus’ ability to withstand, control, or resist sexual pleasure at will. Besides, several stories appear designed to suggest that Aristippus has a kind of wisdom deriving from his Socratic education and helping him to determine the rational thing to do. Like Plato’s Socrates, he believes that genuine virtue is incorruptible (D.L. 2.78), that the philosopher’s moral identity remains unaffected by circumstantial factors (D.L. 2.66), and that the philosopher can always find ways of coping with adversity without compromising his true self (D.L. 2.66; Galen, Protr. 5).

We may also observe that, while he attributes greater value to external goods than Plato’s Socrates or Antisthenes and positively pursues pleasure in a way that they do not, nonetheless, like Socrates and other members of his circle, he ascribes only conditional value to externals and seems to miss no opportunity to denounce loving money for its own sake (D.L. 2.75, Socr. ep. 27). However, Aristippus’ denunciation of vices resting on the overvaluation of external goods takes a distinctive turn. In response to the accusation that he spends too much money on gourmet foods such as fish, he retorts: “well, I am a lover of fish, but you are a lover of money” (D.L. 2.75). The point is not that he ascribes intrinsic value to externals, but that the greed for money is reprehensible, whereas the inclination to live pleasantly and even luxuriously need not be. It is said that, after he was saved from a shipwreck, he sent a message to the citizens of Cyrene admonishing them to seek to acquire only the possessions that a person could carry ashore in case the ship went down (Galen, Protr. 5). This anecdote is unambiguous as to where Aristippus’ priorities lie: the only goods worth having have to do with the soul, not the body; they can only be acquired through philosophy, and they enable us to always act or react in a rational manner (anonymous, Gnom. Vat. 743 n. 44). This presupposes the removal of false beliefs, which, on Aristippus’ view, is closely related to therapy and the eradication of corresponding character faults. Aristippus’ intellectualism, however, does not go as far as entailing that ethical knowledge alone suffices to ensure happiness. Externals appear to play a rôle as well, though, on his view, they have no value in their own right.

The judgement of reason, not the proclivity to pleasure or the theoretical belief in hedonism, chiefly determines Aristippus’ often unconventional attitudes and conduct. According to Xenophon (Mem. 2.1.1–34), he tells Socrates that he prefers neither to rule nor to be ruled but live like a stranger in every land, because he believes that happiness is attained through freedom and self-fulfillment, not the rulers’ exercise of political power or the subjects’ subordination to this latter. Cicero parallels Aristippus’ attitude to that of Socrates, when he warns against taking either of them as a model of civic conduct: the laws and customs of the city should be obeyed, whereas neither of those philosophers has always done so (De off. i.41.148).

Aristippus’ rationalism is also the key to understanding the anecdotes describing his often unconventional, remote, or occasionally shocking behavior. He gave his daughter Arete a philosophical education and appointed her a scholarch, in the face of social convention and sexist prejudice. Even though spurious, the Letter to Arete plausibly depicts him as advising her in a dispassionate and almost impersonal manner, although he clearly cares for her. While deeply attached to Socrates, he decided to remain away from him in his last hours (Plato, Phaedo 59c), allegedly on rational grounds (Socr. ep. 16). He had no compunction to fall at Dionysius’ feet in order to obtain a favour for a friend (D.L. 2.79) or save young men from execution (Soc. ep. 11).

His relations with prostitutes and courtesans are more difficult to explain, but most of them are best interpreted not as testimonies to misogynism, but in light of his rationalistic disregard for convention and the overriding concern for self-control (Ioannis Chrysostomos, Matth. hom. 33,4; D.L. 2.67. 2.69). As for his much reviled relationship with Laïs, he apparently loved this exceptionally gifted woman to the point of risking his life for her sake (Hermesianax, 3.95–8; Athenaeus, Deipn. 13.558e, 559b) and used to spend two months of every year in Aegina in her company (Athenaeus, Deipn. 13.588b). While remaining master of himself, he presumably enjoyed with her not only the pleasures of sex, but also the pleasures afforded by her companionship and ravishing beauty. Indeed, except for Plato, Aristippus appears to be the only Socratic especially sensitive to aesthetic pleasure. Not only did he dedicate one or possibly two dialogues to Laïs, whose extraordinary beauty and charm inspired painters and poets and must have been pleasing to his eyes. Aristippus is also depicted as having a genuine appreciation of fine things, such as soft wool, purple cloth, and nice surroundings, and to always have shunned vulgarity and excess (D.L. 2.76). He fashioned himself, it seems, so as to become an exemplar of a kind: an object of aesthetic enjoyment as well as of moral emulation.

To summarise: the doxographical picture of Aristippus’ beliefs, values, and lifestyle is largely consistent with his identity as a Socratic and has coherence in its own right. As for his widespread reception as an ethical hedonist, it is based on misunderstandings and misinterpretations of the anecdotal evidence about his sayings and way of life. Philosophically, Aristippus’ ethical stance is complex, original, and often challenging (Onfray 2002: 256–257, Gouirand 2005: 241). Although it does not entail presentism or any other kind of normative hedonism, some of his views can be taken to underpin the presentist hedonism defended by his grandson and the mainstream Cyrenaics. In particular, Aristippus’ conception of the pathê of pleasure and pain as affects resulting from physical motions lies at the basis of the ethics defended by different branches of the Cyrenaic school. Something similar can be said about Aristippus’ view that pleasure is a single unified phenomenon located in the present and his admonition to focus on the present and not be concerned about the past or the future. Moreover, Aristippus’ appeal to Socratic values finds close parallels in the ethics of Theodorus, while his eudaemonism and concern for happiness is reflected in different ways, we shall see, in the doctrines of all his successors.

Turning to the vexed question of the relation between Aristippus of Cyrene and the epistemology commonly attributed to his grandson, the latter doctrine, which came to be known as Cyrenaic epistemology simpliciter, is indebted to the school’s founder especially in respect of Aristippus’ conception of the pathê as bodily or psychic motions of which we are conscious as long as they last. Indeed, it seems a natural move to subsequently claim that our consciousness of being affected in a certain manner constitutes knowledge of some sort and, moreover, try to specify the epistemic characteristics of such knowledge. There is no evidence, however, indicating that Aristippus of Cyrene was interested in epistemology in its own right or held epistemological views of his own (contra, Rowe 2015). Nor, in contrast to what has been suggested (Rowe 2015), is there any reason to think that Plato is drawing material from Aristippus when he introduces the theory of the “subtler thinkers” in the Theaetetus. Not only are Aristippus’ views incompatible with the perceptual relativism and the metaphysics of flux advocated by the “subtler thinkers” (see Section 3.2), but also it is attested that he followed Socrates in turning away from other subjects, such as mathematics and physics (Aristotle, Metaph. B2 996a29 ff.), in order to concentrate on ethics. The alleged relation between the Cyrenaics and the “subtler thinkers” will be revisited below.

3. Arete, Aristippus and Younger, and the articulation of the canonical doctrine

3.1 Arete: a woman scholarch of the early fourth century

While it is well attested that Aristippus the Younger is the author of the orthodox Cyrenaic doctrine, it is worth speculating at the outset about Arete’s own contribution to the transformation of her father’s teachings into a systematic philosophical stance. We are told that she was instructed in philosophy by her father, was trained by and with him to despise excess (D.L. 2.72), and eventually succeeded him in the leadership of the Cyrenaic school. Also, allegedly, it was observed by Aristotle that she instructed her son like the female nightingale instructs the young how to sing (Aelian, De nat. an. 3.40). In effect, this means that she taught her son to do as she did and to practice philosophy in the same way that she did. On the basis of dubious Renaissance sources (O’Reilly 2023: 97–8 n. 2), sometimes it is claimed that Arete taught for thirty-five years in Cyrene and Athens, was the author of forty books including an Encomium of Socrates, trained over a hundred philosophers, and was honoured by an epitaph that describes her as “the glory of Greece” adorned with “the beauty of Helen, the virtue of Thirma, the pen of Aristippus, the soul of Socrates, and the tongue of Homer”. Whether or not such praise has a factual basis, it is a rare and remarkable thing for a woman born in the fourth century BCE to have received an education intended for men and to have enjoyed a public career as a scholarch. Regrettably, the ancient sources treat her merely as a link in the Cyrenaic succession, which establishes genealogical and intellectual continuity between Aristippus of Cyrene and his grandson, thus conferring philosophical legitimacy to the latter. Therefore, we know nothing about Arete’s philosophical activities or writings and cannot assess her contribution to Cyrenaic philosophy. She may have practised philosophy in the style and spirit of her father, or, alternatively, may have been the first Cyrenaic philosopher to piece together Aristippus’ ideas into a theory which was subsequently developed by her own son.

3.2 Aristippus the Younger and the development of Cyrenaic epistemology

Building on the physiological and psychological views of Aristippus of Cyrene, and presumably also on the interpretation of these views by Arete, Aristippus the Younger (henceforth also Aristippus unless indicated otherwise) minted a strikingly original epistemology endorsed, so far as we know, by all Cyrenaic sects, with greater or lesser degrees of consistency with their respective ethics. In parallel, he also defended a form of ethical hedonism which was upheld by his mainstream followers as orthodox doctrine, whereas it was challenged in various ways by the other Cyrenaic groups and was attacked by the school’s critics. Both Aristippus’ epistemology and his ethics present considerable interest and will be discussed in turn. However, the epistemology will take pride of place for philosophical reasons that will become clear below.

Following the school’s founder, Aristippus the Younger conceives of the pathê as motions of the flesh or of the soul which come forth to consciousness, presumably unlike other physical or psychic changes that are not felt. In addition to pleasure and pain, however, Aristippus the Younger introduces another group of pathê. They characterise a condition of the perceiving subject in which we feel neither pleasure nor pain and which is comparable to a calm sea (Eusebius, PE 14.18.32). The simile suggests that the pathê under consideration do involve motions, which are milder than the smooth or rough motions resulting in pleasure or pain but, nonetheless, cross the threshold of consciousness. Each of these pathê, we are told, has its own special end, which is neither good (pleasure) nor evil (pain) but an intermediate affect in-between those two. Importantly, the intermediates have practical relevance in so far as we attend to their representational content. According to Sextus,

the pathê constitute the criteria and the ends of things, and we live by attending to evidence and to approval, to evidence regarding the other pathê and to approval regarding pleasure. (M VII.199)

It should be stressed that the intermediate pathê are always representational without always or necessarily involving also pleasurable or painful sensations (pace Brunschwig 1999). Seeing white entails awareness of being affected in that manner, but the perceiving subject need not ipso facto find themselves in a pleasurable or painful state. Indeed, if every pathos had to have an affective component in the sense of being either pleasurable or painful, then the very notion of an intermediate condition would be jeopardised and the doctrine of the Cyrenaics would come dangerously close to Epicureanism in that regard.

Assuming that the intermediates involve physical motions, however gentle these may be, and also assuming that such motions are comparable to those resulting in pleasure and pain, we can plausibly infer that, like every instance of pleasure and pain, every intermediate pathos too is monochronon in the sense of having unity and singularity so long as it lasts. We can also infer that, like pleasure and pain, the intermediate pathê have no prospective or retrospective dimension. Whatever their evidential import, it is confined within the limits of each pathos while it is being experienced. Moreover, comparably to pleasure and pain, whose respective episodes do not differ in ethical value with one another (D.L. 2.87), every intermediate pathos presumably has equal evidential value with respect to every other intermediate pathos. If so, then, as Sextus would put it (M VII.199), we should attend equally to the content of all intermediates, just as we should approve equally of all pleasurable affects or disapprove equally of all painful ones.

These characteristics are especially relevant to the epistemological rôle of the intermediates, and the same holds for the claim that they are detected by internal or inmost touch (tactu intumo: Cicero, Luc. 20, 76). While there is no direct evidence about this latter notion, it seems likely that Aristippus the Younger and his followers shared an intuition encountered in the Epicurean theory of perception (PHerc. 19 fr. 698), namely that, in addition to being directed to their objects, the five senses also have the common function of registering the qualitative changes occurring in the perceiver and involving one’s awareness that one is affected in a certain manner. But while for the Epicureans the affects of which we are conscious through “internal touch” are not the proper objects of knowledge but merely represent features of those objects, for the Cyrenaics they are the only things that can be apprehended. The crucial question to ask is whether the stance that only the pathê are apprehensible is non-epistemic or, alternatively, expresses a genuine epistemological position.

In outline, what is at stake is this. If the aforementioned claim is non-epistemic, the Cyrenaics join the prevailing tradition of Greek philosophers who, in their different ways, couple reality with truth and assume that the objects of knowledge or understanding are located beyond the perceiving subject, in the external world. Since the pathê do not belong to the external realm but are states internal to the perceiver, the Cyrenaic view that only the pathê are apprehensible amounts to the idea that we can only have awareness of our own affects, but cannot access truth or knowledge at all. On the other hand, if the view under consideration is epistemic, the Cyrenaics are probably the earliest philosophers to make first-personal states the focus of attention, vest them with epistemic value, and treat them as criteria of what is true or false, right or wrong. The surviving evidence, we shall now argue, clearly favours an epistemic reading of the aforementioned thesis and justifies treating Aristippus the Younger and his followers as epistemological subjectivists in the sense specified below.

First, the various formulations of the thesis that only the pathê can be apprehended support the epistemic reading and, in particular, the idea that the pathê constitute legitimate if secondary objects of knowledge. According to a reliable testimony by Eusebius (PE xiv.18.32), Aristippus the Younger claimed that “we have sensation (aisthêsin) of our pathê alone”. In the fourth century BCE, the term “aisthêsis” commonly refers to both sensation and perception, and also to knowledge gained through sensory awareness. Thus, Aristippus can plausibly be taken to claim that we can have knowledge only of what we experience (pleasure, pain, or some intermediate pathos) and of nothing else. Indeed, this is how the Cyrenaic thesis was received by most ancient sources, which use the quasi-technical verb katalambanô (to apprehend, to grasp) and its cognate noun katalêpsis (apprehension, cognitive grasp) to render the Cyrenaics’ meaning (Anonymous, ad Tht. 65.30; Eusebius, PE xiv.2.4, 18.31, 19.1; Sextus, M VII.191). Whether or not these terms were part of ordinary language at the time of Aristippus the Younger, several near synonyms were available to him in order to formulate his claim that only the pathê could be sensed and/or known. Likewise, even if the testimonies attributing to the Cyrenaics the view that the pathê are the criteria of truth and the true (Sextus, M VII.191, 195, 199, 200; Cicero, Luc. 21, 142) make anachronistic use of the term “kritêrion”, nonetheless they capture the fact that Aristippus the Younger and his followers are making an epistemic claim. Namely, the claim is not merely that the pathê alone can be felt, but that they alone can establish their content as true of something.

This intuition underpins the neologisms that Aristippus the Younger and the Cyrenaics generally use in order to report pathê and, specifically, the intermediate pathê. These coined expressions appear intended to reveal, precisely, what the pathê are true of.

The sources attest two different types of neologisms designating pathê, one verbal, the other adverbial. The verbal locutions consist in present-tense passive verbs, in the first person singular or plural, or in the third person singular or plural, or in the infinitive. They are intended to be read as first-person, autobiographical reports. They include expressions such as “we are being whitened” (leukainometha: M VII.191), “sweetened” (glykainesthai), “bittered” (pikrainesthai), “chilled” (psychesthai), “warmed” (thermainesthai), “illuminated” (photizesthai), “darkened” (skotizesthai); (Plutarch, adv. Col. 1120e); also reports such as “I am being burnt” (kaiomai) (Anonymous, ad Tht. 65.33), “he is being reddened” (erythrainetai) (Sextus, M VII.192), “they are being reddened, or yellowed” (ôchrainontai) or doubled (dyazontai) (M VII.193). The adverbial formulas are composite and consist of a present-tense passive verb and an adverb: “being disposed whitely” (leukantikôs diatethênai (M VII.192) even by what is not white, “being moved yellowly” (ôchrantikôs kineitai: ibid.) because of vertigo or jaundice, or generally being moved by the same object in different ways (Sextus, M VII.198).

Both types of locutions are attested by our best sources (Sextus, M VII.191–200; Plutarch, adv. Col. 1120e; Anonymous ad Tht. 65.33; Aristocles ap. Euseb. PE 14.19.1 = Aristocles, quoted by Eusebius in the Preparation for the Gospel 14.19.1), are used interchangeably (Sextus, M VII.192–3), and are reserved exclusively for the intermediate pathê, that is, not the smooth or rough motions resulting respectively in pleasure and pain, but the pathê related to an intermediate condition (mesê katastasis) in which “we sense these pathê alone”, namely the pathê that are neither pleasurable nor painful (PE xiv.18.32; Sextus, M VII.199). While the Cyrenaics refer to pleasure and pain, which are supposed to guide our choices and actions, by using words and expressions of ordinary language (hêdonê, ponos, and their cognates), they introduce new locutions in order to refer to the intermediates. The likely reason seems to be epistemological. Namely, they want to highlight the turn away from external reality to episodes or states obtaining within the subject, restrict the application of truth and knowledge to the inner realm, and privilege first-person reports about pathê as opposed to epistemological claims about the external world.

Consider the radical character and seminal importance of that move. Not only does it constitute a major departure from the objectivist and realist commitments of most Greek philosophers, but also effects “the turn within” which eventually becomes a distinguishing mark of modernity. Whether the Cyrenaic pathê qualify as subjective states or the school’s epistemological stance as a form of subjectivism is under debate (Fine 2012, Betegh and Tsouna forthcoming). For present purposes, suffice it to say that, although the pathê necessarily involve awareness or consciousness, they do not seem reducible to subjective states in a modern, post-Cartesian sense of that term, namely the sense of private experiences, each of them associated with a special phenomenological feel. Rather, Cyrenaic references to the pathê often admit of either physicalistic or mentalistic interpretations irreducible to one another (Burnyeat 1982). Arguably, however, it is legitimate to consider the pathê subjective in a broader and less technical sense. Even if Aristippus the Younger and the Cyrenaics do not locate them exclusively in the realm of the mental and do not refer to the feel of what it is like to be in a certain state, nonetheless, as Sextus puts it (M VIII.137–9), they belong to the handful of philosophers who locate the true in a motion within the subject as opposed to the world outside. That motion, Sextus adds, is private and inaccessible to people other than oneself, with the result that consensus is precluded and contradiction becomes impossible. A closer look at the evidence will confirm the epistemic interpretation of the Cyrenaic stance and will show the latter to be subjectivist in the broad sense of that term.

In elaborating the Cyrenaic claim that the pathê are the criteria, Sextus relays the following:

The Cyrenaics say that the pathê are the criteria and that they alone are apprehended and are not deceitful, but that none of the things productive of the pathê are apprehensible or undeceitful. They claim that it is possible to assert infallibly (adiapseustôs), truly (alêthôs), firmly (bebaiôs), and incorrigibly (anexelenktôs) that we are being whitened or sweetened; but it is impossible to assert that the thing productive of the pathos in us is in fact white or sweet. (M VII.191)

On Sextus’ interpretation of the Cyrenaic position, the pathê alone are the criteria because they alone (or, equivalently, the propositions describing them) possess the epistemic properties enabling them to establish truth and the true. Despite significant differences between the Epicurean and the Stoic notions of the criterion (Brunschwig 1988, Striker 1974), both schools treat the criteria as self-evident representational states unfailingly conveying reliable information about the world. In comparable manner, Sextus suggests, the Cyrenaics consider the pathê self-evident and entirely trustworthy in respect of the information that they give, except that this information is not about the world but only about oneself. Correspondingly, first-person reports concerning the pathê enjoy the epistemic characteristics of infallibility, incorrigibility, truth, and firmness. It is evident, therefore, that, on Sextus’ reading of the Cyrenaics, first-person reports about pathê are not merely avowals but carry epistemic weight. In describing one’s own affects, one cannot speak falsely (adiapseustôs) nor can be proved to be wrong (anexelenktôs). Such reports will always be true (cf. alêthôs) and have the sort of firmness (cf. bebaiôs) that Greek philosophers typically ascribe to knowledge or expert understanding (epistêmê). In sum, the Cyrenaics appear to make a very strong epistemological claim: all and only the pathê that one is experiencing at present are infallible and incontestable and carry, each within itself, the firmness and certainty that traditional philosophers ascribe to knowledge; likewise, all and only first-person reports concerning the pathê have those epistemic features; no other kind of state or proposition enjoys the privileged status secured through the first-person perspective.

An excerpt from Plutarch highlights the self-evident character of the pathê and sharpens the contrast between the infallibility of autobiographical reports about pathê and the controversial character of claims about the external world.

They say that we are being sweetened, bittered, chilled, warmed, illuminated, or darkened, each of these pathê carrying within itself its own evidence (enargeian), which is intrinsic to and inseparable from it. But whether the honey is sweet or the young olive-shoot bitter or the hail chilly or the unmixed wine warm or the sun luminous or the night air dark, is contested by many witnesses—wild animals, tame animals, and humans alike. For some dislike honey, others like olive-shoots or are burned off by hail or are chilled by the wine or are blinded by sunlight but see well at night. So, when opinion stays close to the pathê, it preserves the element of infallibility (anamartêton), whereas when it oversteps them and meddles with judgements and assertions about the external objects, it often both disturbs itself and fights against others who receive from the same objects contrary pathê and different sense-impressions. (adv. Col. 1120E-F)

On Plutarch’s account, similarly to the criteria advanced by the main Hellenistic schools, the Cyrenaics’ so-called criteria, namely the pathê, are posited as intrinsically enargê, self-evident, or, in Plutarch’s words, as carrying their own enargeia, evidence, within themselves. Unpacking this claim in terms more familiar to ourselves, one might say that the pathê are self-evident or self-presenting states in the sense that, when they occur, they are apprehended by the subject, or in particular the human subject, without mediation. Correspondingly, the propositions expressing the pathê, are also self-evident and self-presenting, in the sense that their content is apprehended by the subject directly and non-inferentially rather than on the basis of other propositions. The Cyrenaics’ insight is comparable to that of certain twentieth century analytic fundamentalists, in so far as they too assume that the internal states and the corresponding propositions in question share the same characteristics and, therefore, intersubstitution between the former and the latter is legitimate (see notably Chisholm 1966: 23–30 and the discussion in Tsouna 1998: 42–53).

Focusing on the intermediate pathê, the Cyrenaics submit that, when a perceiver is undergoing a pathos, it is self-evident to them that they are currently affected in a certain manner: being sweetened or bittered, feeling cold or warm, being exposed to the light or to darkness, seeing yellow, seeing or imagining Thebes as double, and so on. The perceiver is aware of and infallibly grasps the content of such states. The sources regularly contrast these neologisms with assertions predicating a property of an object: reports such as “I am sweetened” or “I am yellowed” are unfailingly true and incontestable, whereas statements such as “honey is sweet” or “this garment is yellow” cannot be relied upon to convey truths about the alleged sources of those pathê. To the modern mind it might seem that, in effect, the pathê are sensa: mental objects private to the perceiver, whose phenomenal properties are what they appear to be and are directly given to experience (see Glidden 1975, criticised by Tsouna-McKirahan 1992). If so, then, in perceiving a pathos, one would be perceiving something whose phenomenal properties the perceiver alone would have direct access to. However, not only it would not be to the Cyrenaics’ advantage to be burdened with the notorious difficulties afflicting theories of sensa, but also there is no evidence at all that they conceived of the pathê as mental objects or attributed to the pathê anything resembling phenomenal or extensional properties. In fact, rather that postulating a relational act between the perceiver and a given sensum, they refer to the pathê not by using ordinary object-language but by opting for the aforementioned verbal or adverbial expressions, for instance “I am whitened” or, equivalently, “I am affected whitely” (Sextus, M VII.192, 198). Not unlike the proponents of adverbial analysis in the last century (Brentano 1874/1924; Chisholm 1957, 1966; Cornman 1970, 1971, 1975; Sellars 1963: 90, 1964, 1975), the Cyrenaics devise ways of construing the perception of one’s own affects in non-relational terms rendering the manner in which one is being affected or the kind of affect that the subject is undergoing at a given time. Even though the adverbial model that they are probably the first to introduce in the history of philosophy is not free of problems, from an epistemological point of view it works better than the model involving sensa. It is more defensible to claim, as the Cyrenaics do, that one has privileged epistemic access to one’s current condition or disposition than to contend that the perceiver has epistemic authority regarding the properties of some private mental object.

It is not clear whether or not, by introducing those neologisms, the Cyrenaics intended to suggest that our ordinary ways of talking about our own affects ought to be corrected. In any case, that aspect of their theory has significant implications for language and communication and they appear fully aware of that fact.

They say that no criterion is common to mankind, but that common names are assigned to the objects. For all people call something white or sweet in common, but have nothing common that is white or sweet. For each person is aware of his own private pathos, but whether this pathos occurs in him and in his neighbour from a white object neither he himself can tell, since he is not submitting to the pathos of his neighbour, nor can the neighbour tell, since he is not submitting to the pathos of the other person. And since no pathos is common to us all, it is hasty to declare that what appears to me such-and-such appears in the same way to my neighbour as well. (Sextus, M VII.195–6)

Privacy and incorrigibility appear to go hand-in-hand, although it is not clear precisely how the Cyrenaics thought of that relation. On balance, regardless of whether they think of the pathê primarily as experiences or also as physical events, it seems likely that they rely on the premise that the perceiver stands in a special relation to the pathê affecting him and him alone in order to infer that, therefore, he alone can know them in an infallible and incorrigible manner. And because, Sextus’ testimony continues, one’s pathê are private in these ways, the names one uses, namely adjectives such as “white” or “sweet”, have no common referent but express in truth private and incommunicable conditions: the manner in which one is being affected. If, Sextus suggests, it were possible to access the content of each other’s pathê, we might be able to judge whether the object we both describe as “white” is really white or, more generally, we might be able to establish a correspondence between certain categories of linguistic terms that we all use and the things that these terms are supposed to denote. But since the Cyrenaics restrict the criterion (which normally should be common) to the pathê (which are private), it is impossible to establish that sort of correspondence. Instead, if we are convinced by the Cyrenaics, we must accept that language is private in the sense that terms denoting properties refer to nothing that the language-users have commonly access to. However, unlike private language theorists, the Cyrenaics raise no doubts about the meaningfulness of linguistic terms or the effectiveness of linguistic communication. The contrast that they draw between names that we use in common and their referents, which are private, is not intended to defend private language but to underscore the epistemic impossibility of knowing another person’s pathê. The emphasis is on epistemology, not language or semantics.

More generally, the epistemological subjectivism of the Cyrenaics and their scepticism concerning claims about the world does not lead them to question either the existence of other minds or the existence of a mind-independent reality. In fact, their contention that one cannot know another person’s pathê is grounded on the ontological assumption that there are temporally extended subjects other than oneself, and that these subjects are affected in ways comparable to the ways in which oneself is affected, even if the content of their affects may differ. They never appear to wonder whether human-looking individuals or language-users other than oneself might not belong to an entirely different ontological category, or lack temporal identity, or exist only in one’s own mind. Rather, they appear to be realists in these regards, as they are also staunch realists in regard of the so-called problem of the external world. We should say something more about this subject, for it has been a matter of controversy in the secondary literature.

The debate concerns mainly the scope of the thesis that only the pathê can be known, while what lies outside the pathê is unknowable. Do the Cyrenaics challenge only our knowledge or also the existence of anything external to the pathê of the perceiving subject? Do they assume that there is a world of objects independent of (but somehow causally connected to) the pathê , or do they entertain the possibility that each and every pathos is just a logical construction while items ordinarily believed to be real objects and real people are nothing but collections of pathê lacking ontological independence and temporal identity? (In support of the realist interpretation, see Burnyeat 1982, Brunschwig 1999, Lampe 2015, Sedley 2017, and Tsouna 1998 & 2020, while versions of the rival view include Irwin 1991, Rowe 2015, and Zilioli 2012). Both textual and philosophical considerations strongly support the former of these alternatives or tell against the latter.

No ancient source suggests that the Cyrenaics formulated definite views about the existence of a reality external to the perceiver. Nor did they have a philosophical motive for doing so, since their central epistemological contention that only the pathê are apprehensible renders such metaphysical speculation futile. However, the language that they use in order to refer to the causes of the pathê reveals that the default mode of their thinking is fundamentally realist.

Most of the testimonies suggest that the Cyrenaics conceived of the ontological structure of reality in a fairly conventional way. For instance, while they refuse to assert “whether the honey is sweet or the young olive-shoot bitter or the hail chilly or the unmixed wine warm or the sun luminous or the night air dark” (Plutarch, adv. Col. 1120e), the phrasing suggests that they take for granted the existence of things such as honey, olive shoots, hail, wine, and so on, even though, on their view, we can only apprehend the affects that they cause in us and not their real properties. Another set of texts highlights the Cyrenaics’ assumption that the causes of the pathê are typically external to the perceiver, without, however, identifying these causes as particular objects or categories of objects: the pathê are caused by “things affecting the senses from the outside” (Sextus, PH I.215, M VII.197) or, simply, “things from the outside” (Anonymous, ad Tht. 31–2). Yet another group of passages describes these causes merely in terms of the manner in which they affect the percipient: “that which is burning (me)” or “that which is cutting (me)” (Eusebius, PE xiv.19.1), “that which affects some people yellowly and others whitely” (Sextus, M VII.198), or “that which is external and productive of the pathos” (Sextus, M VII.194).

Generally, the Cyrenaics appear to assume that, whether the world is largely populated by familiar objects or is constituted in some other way, there exist things or properties independently of the manner in which they may affect us. Even when they mention cases of pathê involving perceptual illusions or mental illness (Sextus, M VII.193), their evident aim is not to challenge the assumption that our pathê mostly result from our interaction with reality, but to stress that there is no objective criterion that might enable us to distinguish between epistemically reliable pathê reported by normal perceivers and epistemically unreliable ones affecting people who are diseased, hallucinating, or mad.

Admittedly, locutions such as “that which is burning (me)” or “that which is affecting us from the outside” might seem to intimate that Cyrenaic scepticism concerns not only the properties of external objects but also those objects themselves, namely whether they are the kinds of objects we take them to be or whether they exist at all. If this were the case, we should expect the Cyrenaics to use the aforementioned neologisms in respect of objects as well as properties, and thus subjectivise in a radical manner our experience of the world. This, however, is explicitly contradicted by Plutarch (see Kechagia 2011). In his treatise Against Colotes, he mentions an attempt by the Epicurean philosopher Colotes (3d c. BCE) to ridicule the Cyrenaics by claiming that “these men do not say that a man or a horse or a wall is, but that they themselves are being walled or horsed or manned” (Plutarch, adv. Col. 1120d). Nonetheless, Plutarch sets the record straight. He points out that Colotes is using these locutions maliciously, as a professional slanderer would, and corrects him by repeating parts of the doctrine “in the form in which those philosophers teach it” (adv. Col. 1120d): while they say “we are being sweetened”, “bittered”, “chilled”, “warmed”, and so on, they do not employ expressions such as “we are walled” or “horsed” or “manned” (adv. Col. 1120e). This implies that, even though they subjectivise our perception of single properties, they do not do the same for empirical objects. Even though, according to Plutarch, the former thesis implies or naturally leads to the latter (ibid.), it is clear that the Cyrenaics never took that step and refrained from generating systematic doubt about the world. From their own perspective, the assumption of objectivity holds, even though the existence of a sweet or yellow object can be challenged in particular cases.

Evidently, despite the fact that the Cyrenaics and the “subtler thinkers” of the Theaetetus both “locate the true in the movement of thought” (Sextus M VIII.137–9), the contention that their respective theories are extremely similar or identical should be resisted. Ontologically, while the Cyrenaics are more or less conventionalists when it comes to assumptions about the world , the “subtler” defenders of Protagoras in the Theaetetus strain the distinction between objectivity and subjectivity to the limit. Also, the Cyrenaics treat each perceiver as a fairly stable psycho-physical entity in whom transient pathê occur, whereas the “subtler thinkers” argue that both the perceiver and the object of perception exist just for the duration of the perceptual act. Psychologically, the fact that the Cyrenaics associate the pathê, including the intermediates, with bodily or psychic motions cannot by itself establish that Aristippus of Cyrene (Rowe 2015) or, on an alternative view, his grandson (Mondolfo 1953, 1958) constitutes the anonymous target of Plato in the Theaetetus. The association of perception with physiological change is by no means distinctive of the “subtler thinkers” but is explored by many Greek philosophers active in different periods. Epistemically, even supposing that, like the kompsoteroi of the Theaetetus, the Cyrenaics thought of reality as lumps of stuff with causal powers activated in perception, there is no shred of evidence that they were relativists or that they reduced all truth to relative truth. While they are the first to attribute epistemic weight to the subject’s awareness of the pathê, they neither say nor imply that this is an optimal epistemic condition to be in. On the contrary, they seem to think that the truth that really matters is objective truth, but, regrettably, it is not attainable by humans. Finally, the scope and function of these two theories radically differ. The account of perception defended by the “subtler thinkers” on the basis of the metaphysics of flux is intended to underpin an extreme form of relativism and support the contention that all knowledge is perception. On the other hand, the epistemological subjectivism of the Cyrenaics prevents them from advancing any theory about reality, and also from problematising the notion of objective truth. Their view that “when opinion oversteps the pathê and meddles with judgements and assertions about external objects it often disturbs itself” (Plutarch, adv. Col. 1120f) is probably part of what ultimately motivates the turn within. This is a major breakthrough, which preannounces in important ways the dualism of René Descartes and the advent of modernity.

4. Cyrenaic ethics

If, from our own perspective, the epistemological stance of the Cyrenaics appears the most valuable and exciting aspect of their doctrine, the fact remains that, in both antiquity and the modern times, they have primarily been received as ethical hedonists of a particular kind often characterised as hedonic presentism (Sedley 2017), presentist hedonism (Tsouna 2020), or presentism simpliciter (Lampe 2015). Notwithstanding significant differences between the various branches of the school, interpreters of all times contrast the presentist hedonism generally attributed to the Cyrenaics with the eudaemonistic hedonism of Epicurus and his followers. And even though the latter gained far greater visibility and influence than the rival doctrine of the Cyrenaics, it is Aristippus of Cyrene and not Epicurus who occupies the slot of the representative of hedonism in Carneades’ famous “division” of the possible ends of life (Cicero, De fin. 5.20), presumably because Carneades believes him to have fathered the presentism defended by his grandson. Chronologically, Aristippus the Younger must have developed his presentist ethics decades before Epicurus began his professional career, while Epicurus was a close contemporary of Theodorus, Hegesias, and Anniceris. At least the last two of these philosophers retained core aspects of presentism in their ethical doctrines and may have thought of presentism as a theorisation of the lifestyle adopted by the school’s founder (Long 1999). The interactions and rivalries between these schools are intense and complicated, and the controversies between the Cyrenaics and the Epicureans continue for approximately five centuries after the extinction of the last Cyrenaic sects.

4.1 Cyrenaic presentism and the attainment of happiness. The ethics of Aristippus the Younger and his followers

As indicated above, although Aristippus of Cyrene was not a hedonist, his physiological views concerning pleasure and pain eventually became part of the dominant ethics as well as of the epistemological stance of the Cyrenaic school. In fact, the ethical doctrine of Aristippus the Younger, namely presentist hedonism or presentism simpliciter, is often attributed to the Cyrenaics in general, while in reality, as we shall see, the ethics of the Hellenistic sects differ from both the mainstream doctrine and each other.

Acquiring an understanding of what presentism is and what implications it has is not a straightforward matter. For the presentation of that theory by ancient authors can be either too generic or contaminated with material from Anniceris (Lampe 2015: 210–231). Nonetheless, it seems fairly clear that, following the school’s founder, Aristippus the Younger conceives of all pleasures and pains as kinetic, namely consisting of motions, and the same holds about the intermediates (Aristocles ap. Eusebius, Praep.ev. 14.18.32). And although he assigns to the intermediates only epistemological value and no ethical value at all (Sextus, M VII.199), his position has an ethically important implication: the absence of pain is not a kind of pleasure but an affectively neutral state of awareness which is irrelevant to the good life. Also ethically important is Aristippus’ endorsement of the founder’s view that every pathos is unitemporal. Notably, it is one and the same pleasure that occupies the time unit in which it is being experienced. Furthermore, following his grandfather’s lead, Aristippus believes that bodily pleasure is superior to mental pleasure (D.L. 2.87), though the latter is not necessarily dependent on the former. Crucially, he argues, in part on naturalistic grounds (D.L. 2.87–88), that the moral end (telos) is not happiness (eudaemonia) but the particular pleasure presently deriving from each action.

We should pause to consider the original and radical character of this thesis, which receives support on different and complementary grounds. Physiologically, every pleasure necessarily involves a smooth motion, which, however, perishes together with the pleasure it gives rise to (D.L. 2.89). Past and future pleasures, which must be counted in the collection of experiences constituting happiness, involve no motions as such and do not exist as pleasures but only as pleasurable memories or anticipations experienced in the present. Ethically, only present pleasures can have intrinsic value, since only present pleasures, strictly speaking, exist. Epistemologically, only present pleasures or pains can be apprehended, and hence only they can be trustworthy guides to action. Prudentially, it is wiser to focus on the realistic goal of attaining pleasure here and now, for the attainment of a sufficient number of pleasures amounting to happiness can be impeded by adverse circumstances and the turns of fortune (D.L. 2.91). Some sources relay that Aristippus the Younger and the Cyrenaics determine the telos as living pleasantly (Eusebius, PE 14.18.32; cf. Clement, Strom. 2.12.127) and, therefore, might appear to suggest that they defend a eudaemonistic rather than a presentist variety of hedonism. But this need not be so. “Living pleasantly” need not mean that one’s life as a whole is pleasant (in which case the telos would be happiness qua collection of particular pleasures), but, alternatively, can mean living pleasantly at a given time, while experiencing a particular pleasure’ (O’Keefe 2002: 402): an interpretation compatible with presentism. In either case, Aristippus and the orthodox Cyrenaics claim that pleasures do not differ from one another in respect of being more pleasant (D.L. 2.87); all of them have equal value; all are intrinsically choiceworthy (2.88); and every pleasure is good in itself, regardless of its source (2.88).

On this view, then, pleasure is not a scalar notion: it does not admit of differentiations regarding its affective quality, value, or degree. Nor does it admit of verification or falsification, since pleasure and pain are pathê, and the apprehension of one’s own pathê is infallible, incorrigible, and always true (Sextus, M VII.191). In the context of a doctrine positing individual pleasures as the ends and the criteria of action, this is as it should be (M VII.199).

It must be conceded that the presentist ethics of Aristippus the Younger and his followers differs from most other Greek ethical doctrines in so far as it determines the pathos of pleasure experienced at present rather than eudaimonia as the moral end. However, while this move appears to favour ethical egoism and suggests that the virtues and friendship have only instrumental value, it does not automatically imply the total abandonment of the eudaemonistic framework or of all central characteristics of eudaemonistic thinking (contra Annas 1993, criticised by Tsouna 2002 and O’Keefe 2002). In fact, the Cyrenaics do not deny that happiness has value. Their claim is that the value of happiness is derivative and dependent on the individual pleasures constituting a happy life (D.L. 2.87–88). Nor do they view happiness as a means to an end. And they are right not to do so, since leading a happy life is not a means for getting more individual pleasures, even though, on their view, it is composed of such pleasures. What is more, their presentism appears to require that value be ascribed to happiness, albeit of a derivative kind. It has been objected that the Cyrenaics raised doubts about all collections of pathê, including notably empirical objects and temporally extended selves and, therefore have good reason to reject eudaemonism (Irwin 2001; criticized by O’Keefe 2002; Sedley 2017; Tsouna 1998: 130–137 & 2020; Warren 2001, 2014: 201–209). As mentioned, however, there is no evidence whatsoever that the Cyrenaics conceived of objects or persons in compositional terms or denied them temporal identity.

Considered in this light, Cyrenaic presentism cannot justifiably be accused of precluding rational planning (see Graver 2002; O’Keefe 2002; Sedley 2017; Warren 2001 & 2014: 175–210). Assuming that one’s identity persists over time, if one’s present pleasure or pain is, respectively, the greatest good or the greatest evil, and if one’s happiness amounts to a collection (hathroismos: D.L. 90) of individual pleasures, then it is reasonable for a person to plan how to maximise pleasurable episodes but minimise painful episodes in the course of their life. And although the epistemological doctrine of the Cyrenaics implies that such planning can be erroneous or frustrated by adversity, nonetheless, despite what their critics might say (Philodemus, de elect. iii.2–14), their stance does not entail irrationality or unaccountability for one’s actions. Another criticism, namely that hedonic presentism encourages profligacy and immorality by sanctioning the heedless pursuit of day-to-day pleasure (Athenaeus, Deipn. 12.544a-b), also misfires. For in so far as they recognise that happiness is worth pursuing on account of its derivative value, there is need to make discriminations regarding which pleasures to choose and which ones to avoid, partly with an eye to the future. Anniceris explores precisely this line of thinking in his critical engagement with the hedonism of Epicurus.

4.2 The ethics of the Hellenistic sects

4.2.1 Anniceris versus Epicurus on pleasure and other-concern

Anniceris’ philosophical contribution mostly consists in that he defended the main tenets of his school against Epicurus (PHerc. 1005 fr. 111; PHerc. 418 frs. 5.8, 6.9–13; Plutarch, adv. Col. 1120C–1121E; Strabo, Geog. 17.3.22), who deliberately opposed the presentism of the orthodox Cyrenaics on several counts (Tsouna 2016). First of all, Anniceris restated the thesis that pleasure, not happiness, is the telos by arguing that only the former and not the latter can be experienced as a whole (D.L. 2.87, Clement, Strom. 2.21.130.7). Next, he relied on the canonical Cyrenaic view that all pathê involve motions in order to refute both Epicurus’ contention that happiness consists of pleasures extending through all temporal modes and his central thesis that painlessness of the body or the mind is the supreme good (D.L. 2.89–90); in truth, he argued, painlessness is the condition of someone asleep (2.89) or that of a corpse (Clement, Strom. 2.21.130.8–9). Moreover, Anniceris resisted Epicurus’ two-pronged position that mental pleasure is superior to bodily pleasure and, nonetheless, every mental pleasure originates in the body. In fact, Anniceris contended, the converse holds true. Bodily pleasures are better than mental pleasures because they are more familiar to our nature, just as bodily pains are worse than mental pains because they are more repellant to it (D.L. 2.90). Besides, not all mental pleasures originate in their bodily counterparts (2.89); for instance, aesthetic pleasures (Plutarch, Quaest. conv. 5.1 [674a–b]) or patriotic joys do not have the body as their source (D.L. 2.89). The counterexample of patriotic joys illustrates Anniceris’ effort to introduce into the ethics of his school values such as patriotism, respect for one’s parents, concern for others, and disinterested friendship (D.L. 2.96–97).

4.2.2 The pessimism of Hegesias and the eclectic ethics of Theodorus

Hegesias and Theodorus are the last Cyrenaics known to us by name and, as mentioned, they belong to different lines of succession. Hegesias as well as Anniceris descends from Antipater, whereas Theodorus is said to be the pupil of Aristippus the Younger and the last known member of the orthodox Cyrenaics. Unlike Anniceris’ ethics, which remains presentist in its core, the ethics of Hegesias and especially of Theodorus are sui generis and could seem like an anticlimax. In truth, both these doctrines are more interesting than they are usually given credit for (Lampe 2015: 120–167). It seems apposite to complete the present account by highlighting their principal aspects.

Hegesias’ ethics appears to be structured around four main headings: ethical hedonism, pragmatic pessimism, axiological indifference, and a kind of solipsism. First of all, he is said to have posited the same targets (skopous: D.L. 2.96) as the orthodox Cyrenaics, which presumably means that he claimed individual pleasure or pain to be the positive or negative goal of each action and the only infallible guide to what we choose or avoid. Also, like Aristippus the Younger, he appears concerned with the overall goal of one’s life (telos), which however, on Hegesias’ view, is not to maximise the number of individual pleasures experienced over a lifetime, but “to live neither painfully nor distressingly” (D.L. 2.95). Whether the distinction between the target (skopos) of each action and the overall telos of a person’s life is drawn by Hegesias or by later authors, Hegesias appears to interpret the concern of Aristippus the Younger for “living pleasantly” as a eudaemonistic concern for the hedonic quality of one’s life as a whole. And he modifies the orthodox stance by contending that the sage will excel not so much in choosing what is good as in avoiding what is bad (D.L. 2.95).

The grounds for that contention are primarily epistemological. The sage does not differentiate between the various sources of pleasure but considers them indifferent (D.L. 2.95), probably for the reason that one can only apprehend one’s own pathos but can know nothing about the real properties of its external cause. Hence one gives up pursuing the infeasible end of accumulating a sufficient number of pleasures to live happily, but focuses on the more attainable end of living in as pain-free a manner as possible. The psychological insight appears to be this: as a matter of fact, securing pleasure is far more difficult, unpredictable, and rare than avoiding pain; it is preferable, therefore, to lower the bar of our expectations in order to live with as little frustration and sorrow as the human condition permits. Accordingly, Hegesias claims that life and death are indifferents whose relative value depends on the circumstances, and also that wealth, noble birth, slavery or freedom are just as indifferent in respect of pleasure as their opposites (D.L. 2.94–95). Besides, he apparently claimed that only fools believe life to be profitable, whereas the wise person holds it to be indifferent or, on occasion, less advantageous than death (Epiphanius, De fide 9.29).

A different strand of the doxography, however, depicts Hegesias as a positive advocate of death. Cicero reports a fictitious story according to which Hegesias believed that death removes us from evils, not goods, and gave lectures to that effect in the schools of Alexandria, thus triggering a series of suicides and causing Ptolemy to forbid him from addressing the public (Tusc. 1.83–84). In connection with that story, Cicero also refers to the attitude of the protagonist in Hegesias’ book The man who starved himself to death, who tells his friends that he decided to abstain from food and kill himself because he wants to escape from the many pains plaguing human life (Tusc. 1.84). Plutarch puts the story and the book together, asserting that Hegesias’ lectures persuaded many listeners to commit suicide by starvation (Mor. 497d). On account of his alleged advocacy of suicide Hegesias received the sobriquet of The Death-Persuader (D.L. 2.86). In fact, these testimonies rely on apocryphal material which contradicts Hegesias’ explicitly stated view that life and death are indifferent to the sage (Cologne papyrus 205 and Spinelli 1992). They also are in tension with Hegesias’ statement that nothing is pleasant or unpleasant by nature, but rarity or strangeness makes things appear so (D.L. 94–95). Given the epistemological constraints of Cyrenaic subjectivism, it is unlikely that the latter statement by Hegesias was intended to express a metaphysical stance similar to that of Pyrrho (Aristocles ap. Eusebius, Praep. ev. 14.18.1–5) about the nature of things. Rather, his point is ethical: the sage pursues individual pathê of pleasure, each of them a complete and perfect good, in the context of the pragmatic goal of living with as little pain as possible. To attain that goal, it is crucial to be impassive towards things commonly believed to be good. We gain impassivity if we realise that life and death, poverty and wealth, slavery and freedom, noble or humble birth, fame or shame are irrelevant to the measure of pleasure (D.L. 2.94–95).

Hegesias’ sage exhibits characteristics typically attributed to Socrates and highly valued by most Socratics, namely self-sufficiency and independence. However, Hegesias appears to go too far, to the point of exhibiting a kind of solipsistic self-esteem and contempt for others. The sages, we are told, will do everything for their own sake for the reason that they consider no one else as worthy as themselves. And they deem even their greatest benefactors to be indebted to what the sages themselves provide (D.L. 2.95). This attitude may well express Hegesias’ own reception of Socrates’ philosophy and of his relations to others. On some views, it also expresses a heroic mindframe predisposing the sage towards isolation and pessimism (Lampe 2015: 133–146, whose analysis of heroism is informed by Hobbs 2000 and others).

In sum, Hegesias’ ethics combines a presentist conception of the ends of action with a marked concern for the hedonic quality of one’s life as a whole. In these ways it remains rather close to Cyrenaic orthodoxy as well as Anniceris’ version of the doctrine. Continuity is disrupted, however, by Theodorus of Cyrene: an influential philosopher, slightly older than Anniceris and Hegesias, whose views, on the one hand, find parallels in Epicurus and, on the other, remind us of the Socratic heritage of the school.

According to the doxography in Diogenes Laertius, also corroborated by other sources, Theodorus’ most radical move is that he posits joy and grief as the moral ends while downgrading individual episodes of pleasure and pain to the level of intermediates between goodness and badness. He conceives of joy and grief as temporally extended hedonic states, achieved, respectively, by justice and wisdom or folly (D.L. 2.98), and he appears to think of particular pleasures and pains as means of or steps towards those longer-lasting states. His hedonism, then, is eudaemonistic at its core. The virtues of justice and wisdom appear to have a special rôle in respect of the moral end. Theodorus maintains that they are goods and their opposites evils and, if pressed, he might have specified that they have a special instrumental status with regard to the telos, namely joy obtains iff these virtues are present in the soul.

Even so, Theodorus’ ethics is thoroughly egoistic. He rejects friendship on the grounds that it exists neither between fools, since it is based on need and if there is no need it disappears, nor between sages, since it would compromise their self-sufficiency (D.L. 2.98). On his view, not only friendship has no value, but also it may not exist. What common people call friendship is, in fact, a matter of utility; and the genuine friendship that might have obtained between sages, has no place in their lives. Theodorus’ attitude to friendship stands in sharp contrast to that of Anniceris. Also, differently from Anniceris but comparably to Hegesias, Theodorus rejects patriotism on egoistic grounds.

It was reasonable, he thought, for the good person not to risk his life in the defense of his country, for he would never waste his wisdom in order to benefit the unwise. (D.L. 2.98)

This saying, which doxographers attribute to both Theodorus and Hegesias, is almost certainly spurious. Nonetheless, it points to an attitude that these two philosophers share in common: narcissism and disdain for others. But also, the aforementioned passage prompts us to think of Aristippus of Cyrene, who tells Socrates that he wants to be free of the obligations of citizenship and live like a foreigner in every land “as easily and pleasantly as possible” (Xenophon, Mem. 2.1.9).

Theodorus’ break with the orthodox Cyrenaic tradition seems to extend across the board. For not only does he appears to reject the ethical presentism of most Cyrenaics, but also holds views arguably inconsistent with the epistemological stance of the Cyrenaic school. When he talks about wisdom as one of the virtues through which joy is attained, he clearly does not refer to the apprehension of an isolated pathos but to a kind of knowledge that involves practical reasoning on the basis of objective facts and truths. One question to ask, therefore, is why Theodorus pulls off so decisively from the core doctrines of the Cyrenaic school. Taken together, the following observations may suggest an answer.

One factor to consider is that Theodorus was a consummate arguer trained in dialectic by Dionysius the Dialectician (D.L. 2.98). His aim was probably not so much to construct and theoretically defend a eudaemonistic version of hedonism as to free his listeners from the fetters of convention and prejudice. The claims that theft, adultery, and sacrilege are occasionally permissible (D.L. 2.99), and that the sage should indulge his passions openly and regardless of the circumstances are best understood in that light. The same holds for Theodorus’ reputation as an atheist and for the nickname Theodorus the God, which he allegedly earned because of one of Stilpo’s sophisms intended to ridicule Theodorus’ use of logical paradoxes (D.L. 2.99–100). In so far as he argued in a dialectical spirit, Theodorus need not have been committed to the rejection of fundamental Cyrenaic positions, whether or not he felt inclined in that way. An additional consideration is this: assuming that Theodorus was taught by Anniceris (D.L. 2.98) as well as Aristippus the Younger (D.L. 2.86), and given that Anniceris defended presentism against Epicurus, it is possible that Theodorus followed these interactions, realised the drawbacks of presentism, and dropped it in favour of a more attractive conception of the moral end. Yet another motivation for abandoning presentism may have been that Theodorus wanted to underscore his connection, admittedly remote in time, with Aristippus of Cyrene and via him with Socrates, thus claiming the Socratic pedigree for both himself and his own sect.

5. The reception and afterlife of Cyrenaic philosophy

The last known scholarchs of the Hellenistic sects died in the middle or late third century BCE and their respective schools disappeared soon afterwards. Nonetheless, Aristippus of Cyrene or the Cyrenaics figure prominently in the writings of later authors and, especially, in the polemics between the Epicureans and their Academic critics.

As mentioned, despite the fact that, in the late Hellenistic period, Epicurus’ hedonism was well-respected and influential, it was Aristippus of Cyrene who was chosen by Carneades the Academic (214–129/8 BCE) as the representative of hedonism in Carneades’ classification of the possible ends of life (Cicero, De fin. 5.20). Several decades later, in the mid first century BCE, Cicero appears to concur. In the dialectical framework of Cicero’s conversation with Torquatus, the Epicurean spokesman of the De finibus, he remarks that, while Aristippus posits as the telos what we all recognise as pleasure, namely kinetic pleasure (De fin. 2.18–19), Epicurus’ twofold conception of the telos is both counterintuitive and incoherent. Cicero’s verdict is that, even though both doctrines ought to be rejected because they insult the dignity of human beings, nonetheless Aristippus defended his views in a clearer and more consistent way than Epicurus (De fin. 1.23). On the brink of the second century CE, in his virulent critique of Colotes (a second generation Epicurean who wrote a book arguing that it is impossible even to live according to the doctrines of other philosophers), Plutarch draws a similar conclusion. Namely, he claims that the Cyrenaics are better philosophers than the Epicureans, first, because they realise the sceptical implications of their epistemological doctrine whereas the Epicureans do not (adv. Col. 1120d–1121b), next because they can account for the existence of aesthetic pleasures whereas the Epicureans cannot (Quaest. conv. 5.1 [674a–b]), and also because they have ways of tempering the intensity of sexual pleasures whereas the Epicureans have not (Non posse … 1089a–b).

Unsurprisingly, Epicurean authors revive the Cyrenaics to the opposite effect. As indicated, the author of PHerc. 1251, who is probably Philodemus of Gadara, draws out the antirationalistic implications of the Cyrenaic doctrine for human action. If we can only know our pathê, he argues, there can be no rational justification for our choices. We must act impulsively, motivated by present affects of the body or the mind (ii.11–12), while, in the absence of such affects, we have no reason to act at all (iii.1–6). Philodemus’ critique of the Cyrenaics as if they were still active is not a mere rhetorical device but has a dialectical purpose: underscore the superiority of Epicurean hedonism in relation to the widespread attitude of carpe diem and encourage his audience to make the right choice. Approximately five centuries after the extinction of the last Cyrenaic sects, the Epicurean Diogenes of Oinoanda follows an extensive anti-Cyrenaic agenda for similar purposes (frs. 2 iii.7–14, 4 ii.1–9, v = NF 128 ii.2—fr. 33 vi.3, 29 i.1—iii, 34 ii.4–v.1, 44 i.1–iii.14 Smith).

Eventually, the Cyrenaics seem to disappear from the philosophical stage, though resonances of their ethical views are occasionally discernible in the Renaissance and the modern era and become vibrant in the utilitarian tradition, especially the writings of Jeremy Bentham, John Stuart Mill, and Henry Sidgwick. Cyrenaic presentism is resurrected, reinterpreted, and developed by the nineteenth century academic and novelist Walter Pater, constitutes a point of reference for the agenda of Fred Feldman, and inspires the “embodied hedonism” of Michel Onfray (see Lampe 2015: 168–192). Contemporary philosophers engage with certain aspects of Cyrenaic philosophy in work conducted in metaphysics, epistemology, psychology, ethics, and the philosophy of time. Such topics include idealism, different conceptions of objectivity, and issues concerning the nature of subjective knowledge, the use of the first-person indexical, time relativity, the rationality of future-concern, and much else. The pertinence of such questions attests to the lasting philosophical value of Cyrenaic philosophy and explains its numerous revivals in the course of over two millennia.

Bibliography

Primary sources

  • [PHerc.] Herculaneum Papyri. A collection of more than 1,800 papyri that were found in Herculaneum carbonized after the eruption of Mt. Vesuvius.
  • [Cologne papyrus] Cologne Papyrus Collection in Cologne, Germany
  • [ad Tht.] Anonymous, “Commentarium in Platonis Theaetetum” (Commentary to the Theaetetus), G. Bastianini and David Sedley (eds), Corpus dei papiri filosofici greci e latini: CPF. Testi e lessico nei papiri di cultura greca e latina. Parte III: Commentari, Florence: Leo S. Olschki, 1995, 227–562. Draft English translation by George Boys-Stones, Commentary on the Theaetetus: P.Berol. inv. 9782, 10.vi.2024. [ad Tht. translation available online]
  • [Gnom. Vat.] Anonymous, Gnomologium Vaticanum: (E Codice Vaticano Graeco 743) (Texte und Kommentare 2), Leo Sternbach (ed.), Berlin: De Gruyter, 1963. doi:10.1515/9783110828917
  • [VH] Aelian, “Varia Historia”. Printed and translated in Historical Miscellany (Loeb Classical Library 486), N. G. Wilson (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • [De nat. an.] –––, De Natura Animalium, Printed and translated in On Animals (Loeb Classical Library 446, 448–449), A. F. Scholfield (trans.), 3 vols., Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1958–59.
  • [Metaph.] Aristotle, Metaphysics. Translated by C. D. C. Reeve (The New Hackett Aristotle), Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Company 2016.
  • [Deipn.] Athenaeus, Deipnosophistae. Translated as The Learned Banqueters, 8 volumes (Loeb Classical Library 204, 208, 224, 235, 274, 327, 345, 519), S. Douglas Olson (ed./trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2007.
  • [Matth. hom.] Chrysostomos, Ioannis, Saint John Chrysostom: Homilies on the Gospel of Saint Matthew (A Select Library of the Nicene and Post-Nicene Fathers of the Christian Church, Philip Schaff [ed.], vol. X), translated to English by George Prevost; revised, with notes, by M.B. Riddle, New York: The Christian Literature Company, 1888.
  • [Acad.] Cicero, Marcus Tullius, 2014, Academica. Collected and translated in De Natura Deorum: Academica (Loeb Classical Library 268), H. Rackham (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1933.
  • [De fin.] –––, De finibus bonorum et malorum (Loeb Classical Library 40), H. Rackham (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1914.
  • [De off.] –––, De Officiis (Loeb Classical Library 30), Walter Miller (trans.), Cambridge, Mass: Harvard University Press, 1913.
  • [Luc.] –––, Lucullus (Second Academica). Collected and translated in De Natura Deorum: Academica (Loeb Classical Library 268), H. Rackham (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1933.
  • [Tusc.] –––, Tusculan Disputations (Loeb Classical Library 141), J. E. King (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1927.
  • [Strom.] Clement of Alexandria, Stromata. Translated as “The Stromata, or Miscellanies”, William Wilson (trans.), in Ante-Nicene Fathers. Translations of the Writings of the Fathers down to AD 325. Volume 2, Alexander Roberts, James Donaldson, and A. Cleveland Coxe (eds), Buffalo, NY: Christian Literature Publishing Co., 1885, 299–568.
  • [De fide] Epiphanius of Salamis, De fide. Translated in The Panarion of Epiphanius of Salamis. Books II and III: De Fide (Nag Hammadi and Manichaean Studies 79), second, revised edition, Frank Williams (trans.), Leiden/Boston: Brill, 2013.
  • [PE] Eusebius, De evangelica praeparatione. Translated as Preparation for the Gospel, 2 vols., Edwin Hamilton Gifford (trans.), London: Oxford at the Clarendon Press, 1903.
  • Giannantoni, Gabriele (ed.), 1990, Socratis et Socraticorum reliquiae (Elenchos 18), 4 vols, Naples: Bibliopolis.
  • [Socr. Ep.] Socratis quae feruntur epistolae (Beiträge zur Altertumskunde, 94), Josef-Friedrich Borkowski (ed./trans.), Berlin: De Gruyter, 1997.
  • [Protr.] Galen, Protrepticus. Translated as “An Exhortation to Study the Arts” in Galen: An Anthology, P. N. Singer (ed./trans.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2024.
  • Gouirand, Pierre, 2005, Aristippe de Cyrène, le chien royal: une morale du plaisir et de la liberté, Paris: Maisonneuve et Larose.
  • Hermesianax, Fragments collected and translated in Hellenistic Collection: Philitas, Alexander of Aetolia, Hermesianax, Euphorion, Parthenius (The Loeb Classical Library 508), J. L. Lightfoot (ed./trans.), Cambridge, MA/London: Harvard University Press, 2010.
  • [D.L.] Hicks, Robert Drew (trans.), 1925, Lives of Eminent Philosophers: Diogenes Laertius (Loeb Classical Library, 184–185), 2 vols., London/New York: W. Heinemann/G. P. Putnam’s sons. Reprinted Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1972 (same pagination except for intro material). Greek and English.
  • [Divin.instit.] Lactantius, Divinae institutiones. Translated as The Divine Institutes, Books I–VII (The Fathers of the Church 49), Mary Francis McDonald (trans.), Washington, DC: Catholic University of America Press, 1964.
  • [Epit.] –––, Epitome Divinarum institutionum. Printed in L. Caeli Firmiani Lactanti Epitome Divinarum Institutionum (Bibliotheca Scriptorum Graecorum et Romanorum Teubneriana), Eberhard Heck and Antonie Wlosok (eds), Leipzig: Teubner, 1994. Translated as “The Epitome of the Divine Institutes”, William Wilson (trans.), in The Ante-Nicene Fathers: Translations of the Writings of the Fathers down to AD 325. Vol. 7, Alexander Roberts, James Donaldson, and A. Cleveland Coxe (eds), Buffalo, NY: The Christian Literature Company, 1886, 224–258.
  • Mannebach, Erich (ed.), 1961, Aristippi et Cyrenaicorum Fragmenta, Leiden: E. J. Brill.
  • Onfray, Michel, 2002, L’Invention du plaisir: Fragments cyrénaïques (Le livre de poche), Paris: Librairie générale française.
  • [Index Stoicorum] Philodemus, Index Stoicorum. Collected and translated (Italian) in Filodemo – Storia dei filosofi. La Stoà da Zenone a Panezio (PHerc. 1018) (Philosophia antiqua 60), Tiziano Dorandi (ed./trans.), Leiden: Brill. doi:10.1163/9789004320826
  • [de elect.] –––, On Choices and Avoidances (Scuola di Epicuro 15), Giovanni Indelli and Voula Tsouna (eds/trans), Napoli: Bibliopolis, 1995.
  • Plato, Complete Works, John M. Cooper (ed.), Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1997.
  • [adv. Col.] Plutarch, “Adversus Colotem”. Translated as “Reply to Colotes in Defence of the Other Philosophers” in Moralia, Volume XIV (Loeb Classical Library 428), Benedict Einerson and Phillip H. De Lacey (trans), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1967.
  • [De curios.] –––, “De curiositate”. Translated as “On Being a Busybody” in Moralia, Volume VI (Loeb Classical Library 337), W. C. Helmbold (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1939.
  • [De prof. in virt.] –––, “De profectibus in virtute”. Translated as “How a Man May Become Aware of His Progress in Virture” in Moralia, Volume I (Loeb Classical Library 197), Frank Cole Babbitt (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1927.
  • [Lib.ed.] –––, “De liberis educandis”. Translated as “The Education of Children” in Moralia, Volume I (Loeb Classical Library 197), Frank Cole Babbitt (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1927.
  • [Mor.] –––, “De amore prolis”. Translated as “On affection for offspring” in Moralia, Volume VI (Loeb Classical Library 337), W. C. Helmbold (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1939.
  • [Non posse …] –––, “Non posse suaviter vivi secundum Epicurum”. Translated as “That Epicurus Actually Makes a Pleasant Life Impossible” in Moralia, Volume XIV (Loeb Classical Library 428), Benedict Einerson and Phillip H. De Lacey (trans), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1967.
  • [Quaest. conv.] –––, Quaestiones convivalium. Translated as Table Talk with books 1–6 in Moralia, Volume VIII (Loeb Classical Library 424), Paul A. Clement and Herbert B. Hoffleit (trans), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1969; books 7–9 in Moralia, Volume IX (Loeb Classical Library 425), Edwin L. Minar, F. H. Sandbach, and W. C. Helmbold (trans), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1961.
  • [M] Sextus Empiricus, Adversus Mathematicos. Books VII and VIII translated as books I and II of Sextus Empiricus II: Against the Logicians (Loeb Classical Library 291), Robert Gregg Bury (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1935.
  • [PH] –––, Pyrrhoniae Hypotyposes. Translated as Sextus Empiricus I: Outlines of Pyrrhonism (Loeb Classical Library 273), Robert Gregg Bury (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1933.
  • [Geog.] Strabo, Geographica, 17 books. Book 17 translated in Strabo VIII: Geography (Loeb Classical Library 267), Horace Leonard Jones (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1932.
  • [Suda] Suidae lexicon (Lexicographi Graeci 1), Ada Sara Adler (ed.), 5 volumes, Stuttgart: In aedibus B. G. Teubneri, 1928–1938. English translations can be found in Suda On-Line: Byzantine Lexicography, David Whitehead (ed.), 2019. [English Suda available online]
  • [Mem.] Xenophon, Memorabilia. Transated by E. C. Marchant in Xenophon IV: Memorabilia; Oeconomicus ; Symposium ; Apology (Loeb Classical Library 168), E. C. Marchant and O. J. Todd (trans), Jeffrey Henderson (reviser), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1923 [2013 new edition].

Secondary literature

  • Annas, Julia, 1993, The Morality of Happiness, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/0195096525.001.0001
  • Betegh, Gábor and Voula Tsouna, forthcoming, “Varieties of Ancient Subjectivism. The Case of Perception”, to appear in Truth and Relativism in Ancient Philosophy, Matthew Duncombe and Tamer Nawar (eds), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Brentano, Franz, 1874/1924 [1973], Psychologie vom empirischen Standpunkt, Leipzig: Duncker & Humblot. Second edition, Oskar Kraus (ed.), Leipzig: Felix Meiner, 1924. English translation of the second edition, Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint (International Library of Philosophy and Scientific Method), Linda L. McAlister (eds), Antos C. Rancurello, D. B. Terrell, and Linda L. McAlister (trans), London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1973.
  • Brunschwig, Jacques, 1977, “Épicure et le problème du langage privé”, Revue des Sciences Humaines, 163: 157–177.
  • –––, 1986, “The Cradle Argument in Epicureanism and Stoicism”, in The Norms of Nature: Studies in Hellenistic Ethics, Malcolm Schofield and Gisela Striker (eds), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 113–144 (ch. 5).
  • –––, 1988, “Sextus Empiricus on the Κριτήριον: The Sceptic as Conceptual Legatee”, in The Question of “Eclecticism”: Studies in Later Greek Philosophy (Hellenistic Culture and Society 3), John M. Dillon and A. A. Long (eds.), Berkeley, CA: University of California Press, 145–175 (ch. 6).
  • –––, 1999, “Introduction: The Beginnings of Hellenistic Epistemology”, in The Cambridge History of Hellenistic Philosophy, Keimpe Algra, Jonathan Barnes, Jaap Mansfeld, and Malcolm Schofield (eds), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 227–259 (ch. 7). doi:10.1017/CHOL9780521250283.008
  • Burnyeat, Myles F., 1982, “Idealism and Greek Philosophy: What Descartes Saw and Berkeley Missed”, Royal Institute of Philosophy Lecture Series, 13: 19–50. doi:10.1017/S0957042X00001528
  • ––– (ed.), 1990, The Theaetetus of Plato, M. J. Levett (trans.) revised by Myles Burnyeat, Indianapolis: Hackett.
  • Chisholm, Roderick M., 1957, Perceiving: A Philosophical Study (Contemporary Philosophy), Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
  • –––, 1966, Theory of Knowledge (Foundations of Philosophy Series), Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
  • Cornman, James W., 1970, “Sellars, Scientific Realism, and Sensa”, Review of Metaphysics, 23(3): 417–451.
  • –––, 1971, Materialism and Sensations, New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
  • –––, 1975, Perception, Common Sense, and Science, New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
  • Everson, Stephen, 1991, “The Objective Appearance of Pyrrhonism”, in Psychology (Companions to Ancient Thought 2), Stephen Everson (ed.), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 121–147.
  • Fine, Gail, 2003, “Subjectivity, Ancient and Modern: The Cyrenaics, Sextus, and Descartes”, in Hellenistic and Early Modern Philosophy, Jon Miller and Brad Inwood (eds), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 192–231. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511498275.011
  • Glidden, David, 1975, “Protagorean Relativism and the Cyrenaics”, in Studies in Epistemology: Essays (American Philosophical Quarterly Monograph Series 9), Nicholas Rescher (ed.), Oxford: Blackwell, 113–140.
  • Graver, Margaret, 2002, “Managing Mental Pain: Epicurus Vs. Aristippus on the Pre-Rehearsal of Future Ills”, Proceedings of the Boston Area Colloquium in Ancient Philosophy, 17: 155–184. doi:10.1163/22134417-90000030
  • Groarke, Leo, 1990, Greek Scepticism: Anti-Realist Trends in Ancient Thought (McGill-Queen’s Studies in the History of Ideas 14), Montreal: McGill-Queen’s University Press. doi:10.1515/9780773562448
  • Gysembergh, Victor, 2016, “Source et valeur des fragments antiques sans parallèle dans le Livre de l’Amour d’Agostino Nifo”, Revue de philologie, de littérature et d’histoire anciennes, 90(2): 29–45. doi:10.3917/phil.902.0029
  • Hobbs, Angela, 2000, Plato and the Hero: Courage, Manliness, and the Impersonal Good, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511551437
  • Irwin, Terence H., 1991, “Aristippus Against Happiness”:, Monist, 74(1): 55–82. doi:10.5840/monist19917412
  • Kechagia, Eleni, 2011, Plutarch against Colotes: A Lesson in History of Philosphy (Oxford Classical Monographs), Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199597239.001.0001
  • Lampe, Kurt, 2015, The Birth of Hedonism: The Cyrenaic Philosophers and Pleasure as a Way of Life, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press. doi:10.1515/9781400852499
  • Long, Anthony A., 1999, “The Socratic Legacy”, in The Cambridge History of Hellenistic Philosophy, Keimpe Algra, Jonathan Barnes, Jaap Mansfeld, and Malcolm Schofield (eds), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 615–641 (ch. 19); see especially 632–639. doi:10.1017/CHOL9780521250283.020
  • Mondolfo, Rodolfo, 1953, “I Cirenaici e i ‘raffinati’ del Teeteto platonico”, Rivista di Filosofia, 44: 127–135.
  • –––, 1958, La comprensione del soggetto umano nell’antichita classica, Florence: Bompiani.
  • O’Keefe, Tim, 2002, “The Cyrenaics on Pleasure, Happiness, and Future-Concern”, Phronesis, 47(4): 395–416. doi:10.1163/156852802321016550
  • O’Reilly, Katharine R., 2023, “Arete of Cyrene and the Role of Women in Philosophical Lineage”, in Ancient Women Philosophers: Recovered Ideas and New Perspectives, Katharine R. O’Reilly and Caterina Pellò (eds), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 96–113 (ch. 5). doi:10.1017/9781009028769.006
  • Rowe, Christopher, 2015, “The First-Generation Socratics and the Socratic Schools: The Case of the Cyrenaics”, in Zilioli 2015: 26–42.
  • Sedley, David, 2017, “Epicurean versus Cyrenaic Happiness”, in Selfhood and the Soul : Essays on Ancient Thought and Literature in Honour of Christopher Gill, Richard Seaford, John Wilkins, and Matthew Wright (eds), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 89–106 (ch. 5). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780198777250.003.0006
  • Sellars, Wilfrid, 1963, Science, Perception, and Reality (International Library of Philosophy and Scientific Method), New York: Humanities Press.
  • –––, 1964, “Notes on Intentionality”, The Journal of Philosophy, 61(21): 655–665. doi:10.2307/2023043
  • –––, 1975, “The Adverbial Theory of the Objects of Sensation”, Metaphilosophy, 6(2): 144–160. doi:10.1111/j.1467-9973.1975.tb00244.x
  • Spinelli, Emidio, 1992, “P. Köln 205: Il ‘Socrate’ di Egesia?” Zeitschrift für Papyrologie und Epigraphik, 91: 10–14.
  • Striker, Gisela, 1974, “Κριτήριον τῆςς ἀληθείας”, Nachrichten der Akademie der Wissenschaften in Göttingen (Philologisch-Historiche Klasse), 2: 47–110.
  • Tsouna, Voula, 1998, The Epistemology of the Cyrenaic School, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511482663
  • –––, 2002, “Is There an Exception to Greek Eudaemonism?” Le style de la pensée. Recueil des textes en hommage à Jacques Brunschwig, Paris: Les Belle Lettres, 464–489.
  • –––, 2015, “Plato’s Representations of the ‘Socratics’”, in Zilioli 2015: 1–25.
  • –––, 2016, “Cyrenaics and Epicureans on Pleasure and the Good Life: The Original Debate and Its Later Revivals”, in Strategies of Polemics in Greek and Roman Philosophy (Jerusalem Studies in Religion and Culture 21), Sharon Weisser and Naly Thaler (eds), Jerusalem/Leiden/Boston: Brill, 113–149. doi:10.1163/9789004323049_008
  • –––, 2020, “Aristippus of Cyrene”, in Early Greek Ethics, David Conan Wolfsdorf (ed.), Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press, 380–411 (ch. 17). doi:10.1093/oso/9780198758679.003.0018
  • Tsouna Mckirahan, Voula, 1992, “The Cyrenaic Theory of Knowledge”, in Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 10, Julia Annas (ed.), Oxford University Press, 161–192. doi:10.1093/oso/9780198240471.003.0005
  • Tsouna McKirahan, Voula, 1994, “The Socratic Origins of the Cynics and the Cyrenaics”, in The Socratic Movement, Paul A. Vander Waerdt (ed.), Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 367–392 (ch. 14).
  • Warren, James, 2001, “Epicurus and the Pleasures of the Future”, in Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 21, David Sedley (ed.), Oxford University Press, 135–180.
  • –––, 2014, The Pleasures of Reason in Plato, Aristotle, and the Hellenistic Hedonists, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9781139178976
  • Wolfsdorf, David, 2013, Pleasure in Ancient Greek Philosophy (Key Themes in Ancient Philosophy), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511667510
  • Zilioli, Ugo, 2012, The Cyrenaics, Durham: Acumen.
  • ––– (ed.), 2015, From the Socratics to the Socratic Schools: Classical Ethics, Metaphysics and Epistemology, London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781315719467

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Copyright © 2026 by
Voula Tsouna <vtsouna@ucsb.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free