On Mortality

In this supplement we say a bit more about mortality. For example, we ask how it is related to ‘aging,’ whether all living things are mortal, and why living things are mortal.

Mortality v. Immortality

In the main article we suggested that something is mortal if and only if its life will end; it is immortal if and only if its life will not end.

If we assume that dying and ceasing to be alive come to the same thing, then the suggestion on offer is equivalent to the claim that a living thing is mortal if and only if it will die. But defining mortality in terms of ceasing to live rather than in terms of dying has the advantage of being less controversial, as it can be accepted by philosophers such as Feldman, mentioned in Section 2.6, who reject this assumption. Feldman will grant that, in dividing, amoebas stop being alive, even while insisting that they do not die. However, if he agrees that amoebas are mortal, Feldman must also take the awkward position that some mortals never die.

The account of the mortality-immortality distinction could use refinement, if it is possible for the life of an organism to be restored after having been lost. (On this assumption, it is possible for an organism’s life to end at some time even though that organism comes to be alive again at a later time.) Consider an organism whose death has been reversed, and suppose that the organism never again dies. Then it was mortal until it died, but it seems best to say that the organism is immortal after its life is restored, given that it will then be unending. Hence mortality seems to be a temporally-relative property, as captured by the following account:

Something is mortal at time t if and only if it is alive at t but will cease to be alive at some time after t; it is immortal at t if and only if it is alive at t and will not cease to be alive at some time after t.

The dead are neither mortal nor immortal.

Myth has it that Zeus gave Tithonus eternal life but not eternal youth. Imagine a different man who, at age 20, is transformed in a way that makes him stop ‘aging’ in the biological sense (which is discussed in the following section). Suppose he is doubly gifted: he never dies. Then he acquires the power to avoid ‘aging’ when he is 20. We can say he is biologically immortal when he is transformed, not before, but, by the above account, according to which a live object is immortal in virtue of never dying (or never ceasing to live), he is immortal at every moment of his life, even before his transformation. In this sense, nothing alive can become immortal (live a while without bearing the property of immortality then acquire it) without dying first.

Cody Gilmore offers an account of immortality that allows for conceptual possibilities like time travel and circular time passage [he declines to define ‘mortal’ (2016, footnote 37)]. He draws on a modified version of David Lewis’s notion of personal time. For Lewis, personal time is the flow of processes that are endogenous to an individual, such as the beating of her heart, the turnover of cells in her body, and the accumulation of memories. He contrasts it with the flow of processes that are exogenous to her, which take place in objective time, then defines time travel as discrepancies between the two (Lewis 1976, p. 146). According to Gilmore,

you are immortal if and only if, for some positive real number, you are always (at every moment of your personal time) in a position to look forward to at least that many more personal minutes of life. (p. 25)

One implication of Gilmore’s definition is that a person may be immortal but live only a finite amount of objective time. He illustrates this possibility by imagining a man named John who lives over a 95–year interval of objective time, but an ever-increasing amount of his personal time is compressed into the final hour of his objective time. According to Gilmore, John is alive and immortal at every moment of the 95–year interval, even though he is not alive at any time after that interval.

Aging and Senescence

As we get on in years, we decline in a way that is related to mortality. This decline is often called ‘aging,’ but the term ‘aging’ is ambiguous. It can mean at least three things, only one of which concerns mortality.

For an object to age might simply consist in its remaining in existence over some stretch of time: the longer it exists, the older it is, the more it ages.

An object might instead age in the sense that it accrues certain forms of deterioration. Tables, cars, and other inanimate objects are said to age by virtue of accumulating scuffs, dents, and other forms of damage, but they are not mortal.

The third form of aging is peculiar to living things: senescence. Biologists use the term ‘senescence’ for certain forms of deterioration, for losses of certain sorts of function, which living things endure, and also for the process—‘senescing’ we can call it—by which the deterioration is accrued. (We can add that, upon senescing, an organism comes to be ‘senescent.’) But while biologists will say that an organism ‘ages’ in virtue of senescing, they do not say that an organism senesces simply in virtue of passing through time (sometimes they mark the difference by calling the one ‘biological’ aging and the other ‘chronological’ aging). And while both animate and inanimate objects may deteriorate, biologists do not count the deterioration of an inanimate object as senescence.

Over time, senescence may mount up, and make death more and more likely. Hence senescing and mortality are related. But to further clarify the relationship between them we must say more about what senescence is.

Senescence

An organism senesces only if it incurs damage of a certain sort, quantity, and distribution over time.

• Sort: Senescing impairs an organism’s physiology: the endogenous processes by which it develops, maintains itself, and reproduces. The damage involved is loss of physiological function. Molecular damage such as DNA mutation qualifies, when the structure that is damaged plays a constitutive role in an organism’s physiology. Neither mechanical nor structural damage qualify, such as torn tissue or broken bone, as it may leave an organism’s physiology completely intact. When a dog becomes lame due to being struck by a car, or a cat’s body parts are whittled away in a series of fights (part of an ear in one fight, part of a paw in another, and so on), its endogenous processes may operate as well as before. Of course, a bit of functional loss is one thing and its cause is another; impinging solar radiation may end an organism’s ability to synthesize some protein, and while the former is not functional loss the latter is. But often it will be difficult to draw the line between the two.

• Quantity: Senescence is a net loss of physiological function (López-Otín et al. 2013). It occurs if the ability to perform some function declines or is lost altogether and not regained, unless the loss is offset by the gain of some other function. Now, some damage to an organism that otherwise would count as senescence spontaneously heals. The organism deals with it using its endogenous maintenance mechanisms. For example, organisms routinely repair much of the damage done by solar radiation to their DNA molecules. In repairing itself the organism avoids senescing. But sometimes the damage is too great, and an organism’s repair mechanisms are overwhelmed. (A pause is not a loss: organisms that become temporarily dormant stop functioning in certain ways; if they can easily pick up where they left off, say when the winter freeze is over, then they have not lost their ability to do those things.)

• Distribution: Biologists count a loss of function as senescence only if it is the sort of loss that members of its species routinely incur incrementally (Strehler, B.L., 1962). Or at least that is roughly their position, but three caveats apply. The first caveat is that, like the straws, added one by one, that broke the proverbial camel’s back, many incremental events, collectively, may bring about an acute loss of function that qualifies as senescence. This happens on the cellular level when incremental damage to its mitochondria causes a cell to suddenly lose its ability to replicate (Wiley et al. 2016). The second caveat is that senescence may be induced artificially, according to biologists. Say a researcher injects an animal with hormones to directly induce the sort of age-related hair loss (the loss of the capacity to grow hair) that is normally brought on when hair follicles gradually atrophy. The same sort of decline that is normally incremental is here brought on in a wholly different manner, using the injections. The view is that if some form of functional decline otherwise counts as senescence, then decline of the same sort also qualifies, no matter its cause. A third caveat is a consequence of the first two: senescence may come in a spike, in a sudden burst of physiological decline, whose cause is also not incremental. The idea is illustrated by the semelparous Pacific salmon. It is programmed to give itself a surge of cortisol after spawning, causing it to undergo catastrophic senescence. It dies within weeks (Meyer-Ortmanns, H., 2001).

  Each of these three caveats provides exceptions to the traditional, baseline rule that senescence is restricted to the sort of physiological damage that an organism’s peers routinely incur incrementally. The first caveat exempts secondary decline—decline the routine sort tends to cause. To routine and secondary decline, the next caveat adds any decline of the same sort, regardless of cause, and the last caveat includes spikes of baseline or secondary decline.

Let us see if we can provide an account of senescence that makes good on these points about the sort, amount, and distribution of physiological decline involved. To that end, let us coin a term. Let us say that an organism’s loss of function is species-normal deterioration if and only if it is (the sort of) physiological decline that members of that organism’s species tend to accrue (as individual organisms) only (a) incrementally or (b) as the result of such incremental decline. We can then analyze organismal senescence as follows:

An organism senesces if and only if it undergoes a net loss of physiological function produced by species-normal deterioration or by a burst of such deterioration.

So far, we have given an account of senescence that applies to organisms. Cells senescence too, but, with some modifications, our story about organismal senescence can be extended to cellular senescence.

We can begin with a minor adjustment of the notion of species-normal deterioration, to accommodate the fact that cells which are no longer part of an organism (but are still conspecific after a fashion) may senesce.

Let us say that a loss of function of a cell that is part of or derived from an organism is species normal deterioration if and only if the loss is (the sort of) physiological decline that the like cells of members of that organism’s species tend to accrue (as individual cells) only (a) incrementally or (b) as the result of such incremental decline.

Drawing upon the notion of species-normal deterioration, we can formulate an account of cellular senescence that is based on the account of organismal senescence that is already in place. The account will be a preliminary account that will need tweaking for reasons we will bring up later. That said, the preliminary version is as follows:

A cell senesces if and only if it undergoes a net loss of physiological function produced by species-normal deterioration or by a burst of such deterioration.

Note that this account does not imply that an organism senesces if one of its cells does. Damage to a cell need not harm the organism at all (of course, large-scale cellular senescence may well). In fact, cellular senescence, even cell death (apoptosis), benefits an organism in multiple ways. Both help suppress tumor formation, both assist in shaping tissues, and both help organisms to reach and maintain a stable structure and cell composition, in part by removing worn out cells which are replaced with fresh ones.

The account on offer will need modification to better capture the (ever changing) story about cellular senescence that cellular biologists tell. So that we can clarify the gaps needing attention, let us supply a bit of background information.

In a seminal article published in 1961, Leonard Hayflick and Paul Moorhead reported using run-of-the-mill somatic cells (human embryonic lung fibroblasts) to show that even under optimal growth conditions a series of dividing cells eventually ends, reaching “Hayflick’s limit.” They described the phenomenon as “senescence at the cellular level.” Subsequent researchers have greatly expanded upon Hayflick’s work. Much more is known about the process, called the “cell cycle,” or “replication cycle,” by which cells grow, prepare for division, and then divide. More is also known about what halts the cycle, blocking division, either temporarily or permanently (Alberts et al. 2022; Wiley and Campisi, 2016). The cycle may be halted without ending the viability of a cell. It can be halted in a manner that is consistent with its being restarted by the organism of which the cell is part, or in a manner that the organism itself cannot reverse. When a cell’s cycle is reversibly halted, the cell is said to be in a state of ‘quiescence’ (examples: liver cells and white blood cells). As for cycle arrest that the cell cannot reverse, which we can call ‘cycle lockdown,’ it can be initiated in more than one way, one of which involves telomeres. A telomere is the (disposable) end piece of a DNA molecule. When a mother cell undergoes division, it imperfectly copies its own DNA, leaving out a small bit at the tip of the telomere, and each daughter cell is born with a DNA helix that is ‘shorter’ than its mother’s (Alberts et al. 2022). (The daughter cells do not shorten their own DNA helix.) If the DNA helix a cell is born with is too short, the cell will not replicate, and the line of cells leading up to it will have reached “Hayflick’s limit.”

It is now clear that what Hayflick and Moorhead described in their article was a form of deterioration accrued by a cell line, not by an individual cell. The cell line deteriorates (hence senesces) by virtue of the incremental shortening of telomeres, as the telomeres of cells earlier in the series are longer than those of cells later in the series. The shrinking of telomeres occurs during the process by which a mother cell imperfectly copies its own DNA, leaving out the tip of the telomere. By the time the daughter cells are born, the job is done. (We might add that damage to an individual cell’s DNA helix that mimics excessive shortness can trigger cycle lockdown, but what happens is not telomere shrinkage—it does not involve the imperfect copying that is distinctive of shrinkage.)

After they lock down their cycle, cells are usually prompted to begin releasing certain inflammation-inducing chemicals called the Senescence–Associated Secretory Phenotype (SASP), or closely related chemical cocktails. Each of the cell lines Hayflick studied ended in a generation of cells with critically short telomeres which induced cycle lockdown and activated the SASP release mechanism, which, in turn, degraded the cells from within (Bodnar et al., 1998; Coppé et al., 2010). But we now know that the very same SASP release mechanism is part of the toolkit by which organisms respond to wounds and by which embryos are formed (Demaria et al., 2014; Muñoz–Espín et al., 2013). We also know that the release mechanism can be decoupled from cell–cycle lockdown, and that lockdown that is not accompanied by SASP release is necessary for cells such as neurons and myocytes (muscle cells) to reach their final stage of development, their state of terminal differentiation (van Deursen, J.M., 2014). These cells give up their ability to replicate in the course of mastering their specialized function, the physiological function that cells of their sort play in the organisms in which they have evolved.

When Hayflick referred to “senescence at the cellular level,” he was probably using the term ‘senescence’ in the traditional sense. He probably took himself to have discovered that there is a process (whose nature was not yet clear) unfolding along cell lines that is responsible for the deteriorative decline of organisms. Later, when it became clear that the terminal cells in the lines he studied were in lockdown, cellular biologists reached a pivotal conclusion concerning cellular decline, namely that no cell is senescent unless it is in lockdown: lockdown is a necessary condition for cellular senescence. But they remained uncertain about what suffices for a cell to be senescent. Certainly not lockdown, they thought; mere lockage does not constitute a loss of function that is substantial enough to qualify, as is especially well illustrated by locked, terminally differentiated cells, many of which remain robust for years, performing mighty deeds like heavy lifting in the case of myocytes or information processing in the case of neurons (Campisi and d’Adda di Fagagna 2007). In locking down, these do not undergo a net decline at all, as they trade one loss for a greater gain in function. The lockdown-SASP release combination suffices for senescence (when used in wound care the combo leaves cells grossly swollen and degrades the architecture of their nuclei), but the SASP component is not necessary: deterioration that is unaccompanied by SASP release does the trick when combined with cycle arrest, as illustrated by the benign moles that form on skin, whose cells have locked down and become metabolically choked, highly vacuolated, and misshapen. As of 2024, there is an international consensus, expressed in guidelines called the “minimum information for cellular senescence experimentation in vivo” (MICSE), that while cycle lockdown is necessary for a cell to be senescent, further conditions must be met for the cell to qualify. The guidelines describe several conditions, a loose cluster of which must be met. Each of the conditions seems designed to set out a form of decline or structural impairment that makes proper functioning impossible, or marks thereof, that, together with some others, puts the cell over the bar.

The upshot seems to be that a cell’s senescence consists in a loss of function that includes but is not limited to lockdown. ‘Senescence’ is taken to be a threshold concept, in the sense that qualifying cells must at least exceed a certain level of functional loss, but exactly how much loss, beyond lockdown, is indeterminate.

To accommodate the consensus position, we will need to patch the preliminary account of cellular senescence, and distinguish between cell and cell line senescence.

The preliminary account made no mention of cell cycle lockdown. The patched version we need does just that:

A cell senesces if and only if it undergoes a net loss of physiological function produced by species-normal deterioration that includes, but extends beyond, cell cycle lockdown.

(Earlier we noted that no cell’s cycle lockdown is brought on by that very cell’s telomere erosion; does it follow that lockdown is not species-normal deterioration, hence not a form of senescence? It does not. Cycle lockdown (that is not offset by gain of function) qualifies as species-normal deterioration, although, ironically, this is not an upshot of cell line telomere erosion—it is not illustrated by Hayflick’s self-limiting cell lines. Instead, it is shown by examples like the formation of skin moles, where lockdown is prompted by incremental damage to individual cells.)

We can treat telomere erosion as a form of cell-line senescence, rather than cellular senescence, but caution is warranted, as none of the cells in eroding lines goes into cycle lockdown except the terminal members, so the upstream cells do not meet the threshold for senescence. What makes the term ‘senescence’ applicable is that each line, each series, is a degenerative cascade, much like a sequence of analog tape recordings of a song, each made from its predecessor, which ultimately ends in noise. Because each cell makes an imperfect copy of its predecessor’s DNA, eventually the copies are defective in a way that guarantees that the cells they occupy will immediately become senescent.

If we rely on our account of cellular senescence, we can clarify what it is for a cell line to senesce. Let us say that a process is senescence-conducive if and only if a series of cells that performs that process successively will end in a generation of cells that become senescent immediately upon coming into existence. It seems reasonable to say that a cell line is senescent if and only if its members are performing a senescence-conducive process.

Before we move on, we should note that some organisms consist of but one cell. In order to avoid inconsistency, we must therefore keep track of which concept of senescence we are applying to an individual that is at once a cell and an organism.

In complex organisms, it is commonplace for cellular senescence to be unaccompanied by organismal senescence. This cannot happen to a single-celled organism. If undergoing cellular senescence, it undergoes organismal senescence, as in both cases it is incurring a net loss of physiological function. Nevertheless, it may senesce without undergoing cellular senescence, as it may instead undergo organismal senescence. An individual bacterium is a case in point. Single-cell eukaryotes (cells whose genetic material is stored inside a nucleus) lock down when stressed but single-cell prokaryotes (which lack a nucleus) do not. Most bacteria are prokaryotes, and lack the apparatus needed for engineered lock down (Murray, A.W., 1992; Alberts 2022). Given the current consensus position on (and patched account of) cellular senescence, their immunity to lockdown makes them immune to cellular senescence. Yet they do incur organismal senescence, which does not require cycle lockdown.

Needless to say, biologists could avoid this awkward implication (there being single-celled organisms that can senesce organismally but not cellularly), and greatly simply their story, by falling back to the preliminary account of cellular senescence. This would also open the way for dropping lockdown as a necessary condition for cellular senescence, a move that can also be supported on the grounds that (a) cells such as neurons that end the cell cycle in the course of terminal differentiation may later undergo functional decline that clearly counts as senescence, and (b) lockdown, like temporary cycle arrest, is a mechanism by which cells and single-celled organisms divert their energies away from replication to concentrate on repairs of serious damage they have received (Blagosklonny 2012). It is a means by which senescence, even death, is resisted.

Why Does Senescence Occur?

Just about all living things senesce. Why is that?

According to evolutionary biologists, senescence is best explained by one or more, or some combination, of three closely related stories: the antagonistic pleiotropy theory, defended by George Williams (1957), the mutation accumulation theory, proposed by Peter Medawar (1952), and the disposable soma theory, developed by Thomas Kirkwood (1977; Kirkwood, T.B. and Holliday, R., 1979). (See Huneman 2023 for an excellent discussion of these theories.)

Natural selection favors genes that are responsible for traits that make for fecundity (reproductive productivity)—that is, traits that give organisms a better chance of having more offspring than those organisms otherwise would have had. But Williams pointed out that some genes are pleiotropic—they give an organism more than one feature—and a gene that boosts an organism’s fecundity might also give it features that are deleterious to it in various ways. Some of these may give it a worse chance of long life than it otherwise would have had. Such a gene might still be favored by natural selection—precisely because it boosts fecundity. It might be favored despite its deleterious effects, because these present later in life, after the organism would have reproduced. Senescence is the side-effect of the selection of genes responsible for the enhancing trait, and not itself a selected feature—or at least not a directly selected feature.

Like Williams, Medawar emphasized that natural selection is insensitive to the effects genes have late in the lives of organisms, but while Williams’s story emphasizes that traits linked to some genes are only indirectly selected, Medawar’s emphasizes that selection simply does not apply to traits linked to some genes. His mutation accumulation theory says selection will not weed out genes with late onset deleterious effects, so these deleterious genes will tend to accumulate, and senescence results.

The accounts offered by Williams and Medawar are consistent with the possibility that senescing would turn out to be a (set of) wholly uncoordinated process(es) by which an organism deteriorates. But it turns out that senescing is more complicated. In experimental subjects such as Drosophila, nematodes, and mice, genetic pathways that regulate lifespan have been discovered by molecular biologists. There are ‘longevity genes’ that work to increase lifespan (Kenyon, C.J., 2010). There are also genes that promote growth or reproduction that have late onset costs (Kenyon, 2010; Alic and Partridge, 2011). And the various mechanisms by which organisms repair damage that otherwise would accumulate also work to prolong life.

Thomas Kirkwood’s disposable soma view, a refinement of Williams’s antagonistic pleiotropy theory, explicitly addresses these mechanisms that boost longevity. Kirkwood claimed that evolving the mechanisms involves a trade-off between the investment in the mechanisms on the one hand and the investment in reproduction on the other. Contrast mechanisms that work early in the life of an organism as against mechanisms that also work later in its life. The latter tend not to be favored by natural selection because bringing them on line will involve omitting some possible investment in reproduction, and because late term maintenance would come when the organism is increasingly unlikely to survive anyway, say because it starves or gets eaten by a predator.

The upshot of these three stories is that while natural selection is concerned with survival of the fittest, fitness is not merely a matter of longevity—not merely a matter of what boosts an organism’s chances of surviving for a longer rather than a shorter time. Fitness involves longevity, but only insofar as it helps boost fecundity. If a gene enhances fecundity enough, a reduction of longevity might be a good tradeoff, or it might be a tradeoff to which natural selection is blind, as the deleterious effects are late onset.

Senescence and Mortality

How does senescence bear on mortality?

The answer seems to be that some ways of senescing will not make death more likely. That is, losing some physiological capacities due to senescence will not make death more likely. However, losing other capacities will. The general rule is that if an organism senesces long enough in the manner that is typical for organisms of its species, eventually it will become unable to function at all, and it will die (Finch, C.E., 1990). It has a property we can call senescence mortality. The same goes for a cell.

Organisms and cells, even typical lines of organisms and cells—all of these senesce in their own ways. Hence in looking for an answer to our question—how does senescence bear on an object’s mortality—we must keep track of which objects we are asking about. If we want to establish that organismal senescence need not threaten the continued existence of an organism, we cannot adduce examples in which an organism’s chances of persisting are not reduced by the senescing of its cells. Examples like that are easy to come by, but having cells that are senescing does not imply that an organism is senescing. In fact, as we have seen, the former is one of the tools organisms use to avoid (organismal) senescing.

What we need are cases in which there is net decline of an organism’s physiology, yet, despite this, there is no reduction of its prospects for survival. A striking case in point is reproductive senescence, one form of which is follicle exhaustion, reached when follicle atresia (culling) crosses a tipping point after which fertility is lost. Follicle exhaustion is followed by estrogen deprivation; estrogen deprivation does indeed raise the risk of death, but, in itself, follicle exhaustion does not (Shuster, L. T., et al. 2010). Nor does losing (or never gaining) the ability to reproduce (Richardson, L., et al. 2022). If enough organisms of some sort stop reproducing, there soon will be no organisms of that sort. If these are conspecifics, there will be an extinction event. But, in itself, losing or not attaining the ability to reproduce does not make an individual organism’s life more likely to end.

Of course, senescence will be inexorably tied to mortality if we build the link between the two right into the definition of ‘senescence’ (counting nothing as senescence unless it makes death more likely), as evolutionary biologists tend to do. But this practice makes for conceptual confusion. If senescence is tied to mortality by definition, the link between the two cannot be disconfirmed empirically. Cases such as follicle exhaustion that seem to disconfirm the link will be disqualified simply because they fail to meet the definition.

What, now, about cells? Does cellular senescence always threaten the continued existence of the cell that is senescing? It does not. In fact, there is a case for saying that sometimes senescing can do just the opposite, as cells tend to respond to senescence by making themselves resistant to death. They modify themselves so as to avoid apoptosis, or programmed death (Wang, E. 1995).

We can conclude that organisms and cells may lose some of their physiological capacities due to senescence without becoming more likely to die. However, ordinarily senescence is all-inclusive: it affects all of an organism’s physiological capacities. If an organism or cell senesces in the all-inclusive manner that is typical for its kind, and does so long enough, it will die.

The ordinary case of all-inclusive senescence may be described as follows. Complex organisms are assemblies of cells that perform various functions collectively and individually. The cells spring from the zygote through cell division. Downstream cells specialize into lineages of cells with specific functions. Many of the cells continue to divide and replace themselves while others, terminally differentiated cells like neurons, remain, performing some role, for the life of the organism (who cannot outlive its lifers). The assembled cells that compose an organism function well for a time, then slow down. Before long they lose their ability to function at all, and the organism dies. This happens for various reasons, but one sufficient reason for the loss is that the dividing cell lines and the lifers senesce: they accumulate damage they cannot repair. Only the germ cell line weathers the demise of the organism.

Complex organisms delay their demise by routinely replacing many of their cells; single-celled organisms cannot do that, of course. For most of them, senescing will bring about death more quickly. They deal with some of the damage they incur, but not all of it; it accumulates over time, and eventually becomes fatal.

Is Senescence Mortality Avoidable?

Although lengthy, all-inclusive senescence is fatal, an organism would not die by senescing if it did not senesce at all. Needless to say, that would happen if it were killed before it had a chance to senesce, or if became dormant indefinitely. But there are far more interesting possibilities, too. Senesce is avoided in several fascinating ways by organisms, both simple and complex, by cells, and by lines of cells and organisms.

Remarkably, there are some complex organisms, such as the hydra, that achieve what ordinary mortals cannot: under normal conditions, the hydra does not senesce, or rather it senesces very little (Martinez 1998). Biologists sometimes use the term ‘biological immortality’ for insenescence, and the term ‘negligible senescence’ for an extremely low level of senescence (Finch, C.E., 1990). The hydra achieves negligible senescence. Most complex organisms are made up of a relatively small number of stem cells and a relatively large number of terminally differentiated cells, some of which are lifers. In the hydra these proportions are reversed. It avoids senescence because it consists of a proportionally large number of stem cells together with a proportionally small array of specialized cells, none of which are lifers. The stem cells are replicatively unlimited (because they do not senesce, they avoid accumulating damage), and replace themselves and all of the specialized cells on a regular basis. There is a complete turnover in a hydra’s constituent cells every few weeks. This includes neurons, but the neural net’s replacements are staggered, to allow continuity in the network.

Cell lines, too, may achieve negligible senescence. Some, such as insenescent cancer cell lines, do so by using an enzyme called telomerase to block telomere shortening (Shay, J.W. and Wright, W.E., 2011). HeLa cells use this technique. (These cells were derived from a biopsy sample taken from Henrietta Lacks, who later died from cervical cancer.) Other cell lines apply a technique called sequestration when they replicate. When cells replicate, some, like E. coli cells, come apart or divide symmetrically, so that the left daughter cell is equal in mass to the right cell. Other cells, such as budding yeast, come apart asymmetrically, so that Lefty is significantly larger than Righty, which tempts biologists to treat it and the cell that came apart as one and the same mother cell. (The mother carves out a portion of itself to form Rightly.) Cell lines of both sorts—lines that replicate symmetrically and lines that replicate asymmetrically--attain negligible senescence using sequestration. Over time each cell accumulates damaged components it cannot repair. When a cell divides symmetrically, it passes along all of the damaged bits to only one of the equally sized daughter cells, say Lefty. Righty, the clean daughter (and its clean descendants), follows suit, giving rise to a series of cells that have a fresh start, garbage-free (Stewart, E.J., Madden, R., Paul, G. and Taddei, F., 2005). By contrast, the cells in the trash bin series are eventually overwhelmed by garbage, and that line ends, taking the trash out with it. Something similar happens when a cell comes apart asymmetrically, except that, in such lines, the ‘mother’ cell keeps the damaged bits (Aguilaniu, H., Gustafsson, L., Rigoulet, M. and Nyström, T., 2003).

Although cell lines and rare complex organisms like hydras can escape senescence mortality, both rely on death to get the job done. While the lines and hydras live on, their cells do not. Cells that divide symmetrically, splitting down the middle, die—replicating is fatal to them—so even if a cell line achieves ‘immortality,’ all of the cells in the line, trash-free or not, die. Perhaps asymmetrical division delays the death of the ‘mother’ cells, but they, too, succumb when they can assimilate no more trash.

Is there an exceptionless rule here, something to the effect that the road to immortality is paved with death? Perhaps not. The rule does apply to all complex organisms and to all lines, but there are single-celled organisms in the world, such as the giant ciliate (Stentor coeruleus), that escape senescence as individuals (Marshall 2021). Each of these huge cells is a self-repair virtuoso, able to clear and mend damage to itself faster than it accumulates.