Descartes’ Ethics

First published Wed May 20, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Denis Kambouchner and Louis Rouquayrol replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

In a century rich with examples of the kind, Descartes never produced a treatise on ethics. His fourth and last major work, The Passions of the Soul, is not, strictly speaking, one. At the end of the curious exchange of letters that serves as a preface to this treatise, Descartes indicates that he has made his “discourse” (the moral argument?) “so simple and so brief that it will make it know that my intention was not to explain the passions as an orator [as was the case in the treatises on rhetoric], nor even as a moral philosopher, but only as a physicist” (AT XI 326/CSM I 327). This reserve may be a matter of simple caution, but the fact remains that physiological considerations occupy a good half of the work.

If the philosopher had lived longer, would he have engaged in writing a treatise “On Wisdom”—which was usually the main subject of ethical treatises at the time? Nothing is less certain. Descartes’ reluctance to write on moral matters is clearly stated (auctor non libenter scribit ethica) in 1648 in the Conversation with Burman (AT V 178/CSMK 352), as well as in a letter from the same period (To Chanut, November 20, 1647: AT V 86–87/CMSK 326):

It is true that I am in the habit of refusing to write down my thoughts concerning ethics, and this for two reasons: one, that there is no other subject from which malicious people can so readily draw pretexts for slander; the other is that I believe it belongs only to sovereigns, or those authorized by them, to concern themselves with regulating the morals of other people.

The same reservation is confirmed by a series of earlier remarks in letters (to Father Mersenne on November 4, 1630: “If I ever wrote about ethics…” [AT I 172]), but also in the Discourse on the Method, where we nevertheless find the first significant development on this topic. From the very first pages, the author warns:

my intention here is not to teach the method that everyone should follow in order to use their reason properly […]. Those who meddle in giving precepts must consider themselves more skilled than those to whom they give them; and if they fail in the slightest thing, they are blameworthy. (AT VI 4/CSM I 112)

This refers to the method, and therefore to the search for truth in science, but it applies even more to moral matters. That the conduct of reason be unitary, and that it does not admit any limitation of object, is already demonstrated by the solidarity between the Second Part of the Discourse, which introduces the main rules of the method, and the Third, which presents some rules of morality supposed to be “drawn from this method” (AT VI 1/CSM I 111). This is also evident in the first of the Rules for the Direction of the Mind, which defines “good sense” (bona mens) as the “universal wisdom.” “In every situation in life, the intellect should precede the will by showing it which course to choose” (AT X 361/CSM I 10): this is a practical ideal that Descartes undoubtedly adopted very early on, and it is the same, we might think, that we will find in 1647 in the Preface to the Principles of Philosophy, with the reference to the “highest and most perfect ethics, which, presupposing a complete knowledge of the other sciences, is the ultimate degree of wisdom” (AT IXB 14/CSM I 186; regarding the relationship between science and ethics in Descartes, see Boutroux 1896; Canziani 1980).

Associated with this unitary ideal are three convictions that define the Cartesian reasons for caution regarding ethics, which will be detailed in the first section.

1. Descartes’ Three Reasons for Caution

1) Insofar as perfect wisdom implies not only purity of moral intentions but also the maximum adjustment of conduct to the diversity of circumstances, it is an ideal that no one can claim to have attained. The fact is rather that all men, regardless of their merits, remain substantially far from it, so that in this matter, even those who devote themselves to the search for truth cannot claim anything. This is the first reason for Descartes’ caution, which can be summarized in a single question: why should I, with my limited experience, undertake to give lessons? If it is necessary to address moral questions—unless a whole prior elaboration provides a new epistemic certainty in these matters—the only viable path, then, is that taken by the Discourse: a presentation in subjective mode, touching on what the author has found good and right for himself, and the rules he has set for himself. This subjective presentation has a great precedent in Montaigne’s Essays, in which fundamentally skeptical positions nevertheless give rise to a whole range of reflections on morality. In Descartes, the reserve linked to the subjective mode is coupled with an explicit epistemic reserve: the rules that can be stated have only been adopted “provisionally,” that is, pending further refinement linked to more complete reflection (AT VI 22).

(On the relationship between Descartes’ ethics and skepticism, see Marshall 2003; Kambouchner 2017.)

2) A certain number of moral truths, relating to good and to bad actions, are communicated through all channels of society and are therefore known to all (Rouquayrol 2025). Descartes never provided even a summary list of these common notions of morals, as he did in the field of ontology. In any case, it is not the role of a philosopher to draw up a catalog of crimes or virtuous actions, and if the people he is dealing with do not seem to share the common sentiment on these subjects, it will be beyond his power to correct their minds. On the other hand, Descartes shares with certain ancient philosophers, especially Stoics and Epicureans, the idea that our representation of the world, and first and foremost our notion of what fundamentally exists, already does much to give us access to wisdom. This must include physical knowledge of nature and of our own bodies—which is precisely why Descartes writes a treatise that will be partly about ethics “as a physicist.” Recognizing our own nature as minds and our principal faculties; measuring as far as possible the perfections of God, who created a universe of indefinite extent; examining the “machine of our body,” including the brain, and its interactions with surrounding bodies, but also with the soul that is closely united with it: all these contribute very significantly to regulating our representation of ourselves, and therefore our relationship to events and our own actions. In this respect, the construction of a moral code cannot be separated from the construction of Cartesian philosophy as a whole. The famous image presented in the Preface to the Principles indicates this quite clearly: the “highest and most perfect ethics” will be the highest branch of the tree of philosophy as a whole—which does not mean that it can only grow after the other parts of philosophy, but that it grows with them (see Morgan 1994) and feeds on their roots and trunk.

(On Descartes and Stoicism, see Brochard 1880; Olivo 1999; Rutherford 2014; on Descartes and Epicureanism, see Gueroult 1953; Vuillemin 1981. For a reading that emphasizes Descartes’ eclecticism, see Mesnard 1936.)

3) If, as the same text indicates, “the main usefulness of philosophy depends on those parts of it that can only be learned last of all” (AT IXB 15/CSM I 186), the philosophy to be cultivated must nevertheless be useful from the outset. This usefulness is particularly evident in the answer to the question of which path to choose in life. Quod vitae sectabor iter? is the first line of a poem by Ausonius of Bordeaux, a 4th-century poet, which the young Descartes, one night in the fall of 1619, found in a dream in a large collection of Latin poetry (Pierre de la Brosse’s Corpus poetarum). This canonical question of ancient ethics is found at the end of the third part of Discourse on the Method:

To conclude this moral code, I decided to review the various occupations that men have in this life, in order to try to choose the best one.

The answer is immediately obvious:

Without wishing to say anything about [the occupations] of others, I thought that I could do no better than to continue in the one I was already engaged in, that is, to devote my whole life to cultivating my reason and advancing as far as I could in the knowledge of truth, following the method I had prescribed for myself. (AT VI 27/CSM I 125)

That the young Descartes immediately finds himself on the right path—and on a path that he will subsequently recommend (AT VI 63/CSM I 143) to all good minds—means that, for him, the moral problem arises only in a limited and non-dramatic way, in other words, that the philosopher finds no kind of demon to fight within himself. The Passions of the Soul will later deal (art. 47) with “the struggles that we usually imagine between the lower part of the soul and the higher part,” the lower part “which we call sensitive, and the higher part which is rational.” But this will be to indicate that:

The error which has been committed in making it play different characters, which are usually opposed to one another, comes only from the fact that its functions have not been rightly distinguished from those of the body, to which alone we must attribute everything to be found in us that is opposed to our reason. (AT XI 364–365/CSM I 346)

This indication is quite significant: according to Descartes, the human soul knows no internal conflict, strictly speaking; and he has previously emphasized that Ovid’s famous phrase, video meliora proboque, deteriora sequor, “I see what is better and I approve of it, but I follow what is worse,” “is only for weak minds” (To Mersenne, May 1637: AT I 366/CSMK 56)—“those weak and vacillating minds,” says the Discourse, “who allow themselves to be unsteadly led into practicing, as good, things which they then judge to be evil” (AT VI 25/CSM I 123).

In other words, Descartes has very little to say about sin. Martial Gueroult is undoubtedly wrong to write that “Descartes’ ethics is that of an atheist” (Gueroult 1953: 222–236), but a certain Christian torment seems foreign to his thinking, and is absent from Descartes’ writings. (Regarding the relationship between Descartes’ ethics and Christianity, see Gouhier 1924; Steiner 2004; Chukurian 2023.)

These points, as expressions of Descartes’ core ethical commitments, will reappear in various forms in the following sections.

2. Definition and Substance of the “Provisional Moral Code”

In the notes written by the young Descartes in 1619, subsequently preserved in his papers, later copied by Leibniz, found in Hanover, and published in 1858–1860 by Count Foucher de Careil, a few thoughts relate to ethics. In addition to the biblical epigraph, “The fear of God is the beginning of wisdom” (AT X 213/CSM I 1), there is, for example, a Stoic-inspired note on vices, described as “diseases of the soul, which are more difficult to distinguish than diseases of the body, because we have often experienced good health of the body, but never that of the mind” (AT X 215/CSM I 3). However, we have no more on ethics from Descartes’ pen before the Third Part of the Discourse on the Method, which, according to the Preface to the Principles of Philosophy, provides “the principal rules […] of an imperfect ethics that one can follow provisionally while one does not yet know a better one” (AT IXB 15/CSM I 186–187; see Beyssade 1990; Carraud 1997; Marshall 2003; Cimakasky and Polansky 2012).

The first three rules or “maxims” of this moral code are well known (AT VI 22–27/CSM I 122–124). The first is entirely about prudence, particularly in social terms: “obey the laws and customs of my country,” retain “the religion in which God by his Grace has instructed me since childhood,” and “govern myself in all other matters according to the most moderate opinions, and those furthest removed from excess, which are commonly accepted in practice by the most sensible of those with whom I have to live;” avoid excesses, including those of “promises by which one gives up some of one’s freedom.”

The second maxim is that of resolution in situations of uncertainty:

since the actions of life often suffer no delay, it is a very certain truth that when it is not in our power to discern the truest opinions, we must follow the most probable ones; and even […] decide on a few, and consider them afterwards, not as doubtful, but as very true and very certain

not absolutely, but “insofar as they relate to practice,” that is, in relation to the situation as we have come to understand it.

As for the third maxim, it remains, quite explicitly, close to the teaching of the Stoics: “always strive to master myself rather than fortune,” which means accepting the order of the world and renouncing all inner protest when something we have desired does not happen; rather, consider that thing as having been absolutely impossible, and be satisfied, “after we have done our best,” since only our thoughts—including our efforts—have been “entirely within our power.”

This moral code concludes, as we have seen, with the decision to continue along the path taken, namely “to devote my whole life to cultivating my reason and advancing as far as I could in the knowledge of truth” (AT VI 27/CSM I 124). So what is so “imperfect” about it? In a letter from 1638 (To Reneri for Pollot, April or May 1638: AT II 34–37/CSMK 96–98), Descartes justifies each of its main points; and seven years later, in a letter to Princess Elisabeth (August 4, 1645), he repeats them without reservation:

it seems to me that each person can make himself content by himself, without expecting anything from elsewhere, provided only that he observes three things, to which the three rules of morals, which I have set forth in the Discourse on the Method, relate. (AT IV 265/CSMK 257)

The only notable change concerns the first of these rules, from which all reference to the opinions and customs of the people with whom one must live has been removed: it is now sufficient for each person to “always employ his mind as well as he can to discover what he should or should not do in all the circumstances of life” (ibid.). This revision can be explained by the inherent complexity of this first rule: it required that, in all matters not prescribed, one should conduct oneself “according to the most moderate opinions, and those furthest removed from excess, which are commonly accepted in practice by the most sensible people…,” while remaining “irresolute in [one’s] judgments” and becoming accustomed to “counting for nothing” one’s own opinions, all of which were to be “re-examined” (AT VI 22–23/CSM I 122–123). Indeed, how could one discern these “most moderate opinions” without a great deal of judgment (Lories 2008)?

In any case, with certain adjustments, these three rules are no longer “provisional.” This means that the whole was already solid, and in fact, the third maxim of the Discourse, on the regulation of desires, will be found in substance in 1649 in article 145 of The Passions of the Soul. Furthermore, the moral code outlined in the Third Part is enriched by several reflections in the Sixth Part, particularly on the relationship between health and wisdom, and on the central importance of medicine (AT VI 62/CSM I 142–143).

The moral part of the Discourse is not “imperfect” in the articulation of its argument, but in its intrinsic limitations, in other words, in its incompleteness in comparison with a more comprehensive concept of what a moral doctrine (an ethics) can offer. In particular, it says nothing about the nature of the “supreme good” or the relationships between virtues; it does not address the passions and our power over them; nor does it say anything about our duties, the reality of our free will, or the conditions of our merit. And if, in the Conversation with Burman, Descartes indicates that “he was compelled to include these rules in his writing because of the Schoolmen and similar people, because otherwise they would say that he has no religion or faith, and that with his method he wants to overthrow them” (AT V 178/CSMK 352–353), it is surprising that in the “provisional moral code,” the part played by faith and piety is so insignificant, apart from the fidelity to the religion of childhood mentioned in the first lines. Behind their rhetoric of caution, these pages of the Discourse reveal an independence of mind that was unlikely to satisfy theologians; and they would have fueled the accusations of the Calvinists of Utrecht in the years 1640–1642, had they read Descartes in French.

3. The Ethics of Metaphysics

The Metaphysical Meditations of 1641 contain no development of Descartes’ ethical thought, and remarks that could be cited in this regard are very rare. The Fourth Meditation, which deals with error, is simply titled: On the True and the False. However, Descartes cannot avoid mentioning good and evil (AT VII 58/CSM II 40), and clearly indicates that when my will strays into things I do not understand, it causes “me to err and to sin.” This page, and no doubt also, further on, the remark that “the privation in which alone consists the formal reason [= the essence] of error and sin […] requires no assistance from God” (AT VII 60–61/CSM II 42), justified a reservation on the part of Arnauld, author of the Fourth Objections: “the things he [Descartes] says here concerning the cause of error would be subject to very serious objections” if they were extended to what concerns the pursuit of good and evil. Now, it is prudent, Arnauld adds, “that all things that do not serve the subject and that may give rise to many disputes be removed” (AT VII 215–216/CSM II 151). Descartes protested:

in the fourth Meditation I spoke only of the error committed in discerning true from false, and not of that which occurs in the pursuit of good and evil; and […] I have always excluded matters which belong to faith and the actions of our life, when I said that we should assent only to things that we know with evidence: this is something that the whole content of my Meditations makes clear. (AT VII 247–248/CSM II 172)

However, he did insert (in parenthesis) this warning in the Summary of the Meditations, which is placed at the beginning of the work:

I do not deal at all here with sin, that is, with the error that is committed in the pursuit of good and evil, but only with that which occurs in discriminating between what is true and what is false; and I do not intend to speak here of things that pertain to faith or to the conduct of life, but only of those that concern speculative truths known solely by the aid of the natural light. (AT VII 15/CSM II 11)

Without going into any specifically ethical details, let alone theological ones, the Fourth Meditation could not remain entirely outside the subject: if error stems from a defective use of our will, how could a fault not be involved? This Meditation therefore provides at least the rudiments of an ethic for knowledge, articulated in the form of control that the will or faculty of choice in our mind exerts, on the one hand, over its representations and, on the other, over its own inclinations (see Engel 2002; De Araujo 2002; Naaman-Zauderer 2010; Sosa 2017). And this control is not purely prescribed: it is exercised and staged throughout the entire Meditations, starting with the first. Of course, when it becomes necessary to leave the realm of pure reflection and even that of science for that of action and conduct in the world, the question posed in the “provisional moral code” will resurface: what certainty, what evidence, what degree of clarity and distinction can be achieved in the various situations of life? But it will always be up to the same mind to determine how far its inquiry can be pushed.

The second level on which we can find moral substance in the Meditations is that of the relationship between the meditator (the ego cogitans) and his creator. At first, with the “general demolition of [his] former opinions” (AT VII 18/CSM II 13), the meditator experiences the full extent of his freedom. In a second stage, however, he discovers within himself the idea of a being infinite in perfection and power, and must conclude that this being necessarily exists and that his own existence depends on it at every moment. The fact that there is neither “order, nor law, nor reason of truth and goodness” that does not “depend” on the “immensity” of God will be mentioned only in the Replies to the Sixth Objections (AT VII 435/CSM II 293–294; see Bouriau 2005), but this follows from the statements of the 1630 letters to Mersenne (CSMK 20–26) concerning the divine creation of eternal truths.

Even outside of worship, which is not the subject of this treatise, this knowledge of God is a source of duties: we must always keep in mind that we owe everything to God; that even though he has given us a will that “has no limits” (AT II 628/CSMK 141–142) and may even “in some way seem infinite” (AT VIIIA 18/CSM I 204), and although we can say that he created us “in his image and likeness” (AT VII 51/CSM II 35), there is no proportion between his power and ours; and in particular, that our power of intellection (or knowledge) remains very limited, so that we, “purely human men” (hommes purement hommes), as the beginning of the Discourse says (AT VI 3/CSM I 112), must in no case prejudge his ends or his decrees, nor, a fortiori, undertake to teach them to other people. The only reasonable proposition that can be made in these matters is that if God has given us our faculties, first and foremost our intellect and will, but also our imagination and senses, it is so that we may use them well.

In this regard, Descartes avoids getting bogged down in disputes about free will, which have filled libraries and have not ceased, especially since Luther’s Reformation. It must be understood, on the one hand, that when we accept something as true or set out to pursue a good, we do not feel ourselves to be determined by any external force (AT VII 57/CSM II 40); but also, on the other hand, “that not the slightest thought can enter a man’s mind unless God wills and has willed from all eternity that it should enter” (To Elisabeth, October 6, 1645: AT IV 314/CSMK 272). That God “leaves the free actions of men indeterminate” (Principles I, 41: AT VIIIA 20/CSM I 206) is to be understood exclusively in terms of a plan of causality internal to the created world (Schmaltz 2012). How these actions can remain free, and yet have been foreseen and willed by God from all eternity, is something we must give up trying to understand. It is, moreover, with a certain carelessness that Descartes, after characterizing “the indifference I feel when I am not carried toward one side rather than another by the weight of any reason” as “the lowest degree of freedom”—so that we could be “entirely free, without ever being indifferent” (AT VII 58/CSM II 40)—then places a certain indifference at the heart of human freedom (in the Principles, I, art. 39, as in the letters to Father Mesland from 1644–1645). (On freedom, compatibilism, and its ethical consequences, see Gilson 1913; Laporte 1937; Grimaldi 1988; Chappell 1994; Davenport 2006; Lennon 2015; Ragland 2016.)

Another question: is this infinite and “incomprehensible” God, whose supreme perfections our mind “cannot grasp, but can only be grasped by”, illas on tam capere quam ab ipsis capi (First Replies: AT VII 114/CSM II 82), a lovable God (Arbib 2014)? The Third Meditation culminates in a moment of ecstatic contemplation, of “pondering his attributes at leisure, considering, admiring, and adoring the incomparable beauty of this immense light,” and it is said of this meditation that it “makes us enjoy the greatest contentment we are capable of feeling in this life” (AT VII, 52/CSM II 35–36). Later, in a letter to Chanut dated February 1, 1647, Descartes will endeavor to show how, although God is in no way an object of imagination, we can “imagine our love itself,” that is, “consider ourselves as a very small part of all the immensity of the things he has created;” “and the mere idea of this union is enough to […] cause a very violent passion” (AT IV 610/CSMK 310). The demonstration seems a little forced. But if it is true that God has given us everything that is in us as a positive gift, and that everything that happens to us is the result of his providence, he appears at least as such to be the object par excellence of an intellectual love.

The letter to Chanut on the love of God follows on from the reflections that Descartes developed in 1645–1646, in response to Princess Elisabeth’s questions on the nature of the passions of the soul (see Shapiro 2007; Kolesnik-Antoine and Pellegrin 2014.) These reflections themselves follow on from the observations in the Sixth Meditation (Shapiro 2005) and the end of the Principia (IV, art. 189–198) concerning the union of the soul and the body. Indeed, since God is not deceitful, we must acknowledge that our mind is very closely joined to a body, with which it seems to form unum quid, “some one thing” (Sixth Meditation, AT VII 81/CSM II 56), “a single whole” in the French version of the Sixth Meditation (AT IX 64). Not only do the bodies around us cause certain impressions in our sense organs, in our brain, and then in our mind, which inform us about what is useful or harmful to our body, but as a result of these sensory impressions, we experience emotions (affectus) and appetites that occupy our thoughts and solicit our will. Another achievement of Descartes’ philosophy was to shed light on the nature and function of these impressions and emotions, and to explain the power that the soul or mind does or does not have over them (see Greenberg 2007; Brassfield 2012; Kisner 2018). A whole part of ethics depends on this explanation.

4. The Soul and its Passions

Even though the early 17th century saw a proliferation of treatises on the passions, the study of emotions had never been neglected by scholastic philosophy (for more on this context, see Bénichou 1948; Deprun 1988; James 1997; Levi 1964; Perler 2011.) The scholastics had produced a definition of the passions of the soul that was taken up by many authors: they are “movements of the sensitive appetite, resulting from the apprehension of good or evil, and followed by an unnatural [= violent] modification of the body” (Eustachius, Summa philosophiae, Pars III, Tractatus ii, q. 2). According to this definition, the soul’s reaction to a certain circumstance takes precedence over the physiological dimension of emotion. In Descartes’ treatise Passions of the Soul (1649), this relationship is reversed (regarding this treatise, see Kambouchner 1995; Talon-Hugon 2002; Brown 2006; Marion 2013; Belgioioso and Carraud 2020). Following Descartes, each of our passions is “caused, maintained, and strengthened” (art. 27; CSM I 338–339) by a certain movement of the animal spirits, those “most subtle parts of the blood” (art. 10; CSM I 331) that circulate incessantly in the brain and in the “small tubes of the nerves.” These movements of the animal spirits, which alter the disposition of the organs, limbs, and even the face, are themselves caused by impressions formed in the brain, particularly in the “little gland” (pineal gland or epiphysis) which, located in the middle of the brain, must be taken as the “principal seat” of the soul (art. 32; CSM I 340). A thought that our soul has of its own accord can therefore excite a passion in us, insofar as it gives rise to an imagination, that is, an impression in the brain. However, a number of our passions are aroused “without the soul contributing to them” (art. 38; CSM I 342–343), solely through the effect of what Descartes calls the “disposition of the brain,” as well as through the interplay of memory and purely physical habits (regarding those physiological aspects, see Bitbol-Hespériès 1990; Kambouchner, Lacroux, Schmaltz, and She 2024).

The first result of this new approach to emotional phenomena, as seen above, is to eliminate the representation of internal struggles within the soul—struggles about which Descartes goes so far as to write that “the same soul that is sensitive is rational,” and that “all its appetites are volitions” (art. 47; CSM I 346). Any struggle we experience, in fact, pits the soul, with its wills, against the body, with its habitual reactions—reactions whose relevance in a given circumstance appears limited. Now, if our passions are the effects of a mechanical causality external to the soul, how can our soul combat them? Some of Descartes’ statements, which have been widely criticized, suggest that the soul, although entirely incorporeal, can act directly on the brain by applying a certain force to the “little gland” that constitutes its “principal seat.” However, a careful reading of the texts leads us to revise this model: the soul can act in the brain only by opposing the imaginings linked to the passion it wants to combat with certain other representations that are themselves habitual in nature and, as such, endowed with a certain “force” (art. 47–48). These “proper weapons” of the will are, according to article 48 of The Passions of the Soul, “firm and determinate judgments concerning the knowledge of good and evil.” But in order for these to effectively oppose the present passion, they must be associated with certain specific imaginations.

This means that while “the weakest souls […] are those whose will is continually carried away by present passions,” the strongest have little difficulty in fighting their passions (art. 48; CSM I 347). Does this mean they experience none? Not at all; rather, they have only good passions, and by the force of their judgments, they keep them within proper bounds – those which, moreover, are best suited to maintaining the health of the body. In fact, Descartes writes to Chanut (November 1, 1646: AT IV 538/CSMK 300): “In examining [the passions], I found almost all of them to be good, and so useful to this life that our soul would have no reason to want to remain joined to its body for a single moment if it could not feel them.” The same tone is found in the conclusion of the 1649 treatise: “we see that they are all good in their nature, and that we have nothing to avoid but their misuse or excess” (art. 211; CSM I 403).

What, then, are our passions? After listing around forty of them, Descartes distinguishes six “simple and primitive” passions (art. 69; CSM I 353; see Beyssade 1983): wonder (admiration), which we feel for things that seem “rare and extraordinary” (art. 70; CSM I 353; see Barrier 2019); love, which unites us with what does us good; hatred, which distances us from what does us harm; and desire, joy, and sadness — emotions linked to these same objects, depending on whether they are absent or present. What would life be without these emotions? Can the exercise of virtue itself do without passion?

Descartes’ answer to this last question is clearly negative. “According to the institution of Nature,” he says (art. 137; CSM I 376), passions “all relate to the body, and are given to the soul only insofar as it is joined with it: so that their natural use is to incite the soul to consent to and contribute to actions that may serve to preserve the body, or to make it in some way more perfect.” But they also have a use that affects the soul itself, or the whole person. This is particularly the case with esteem and contempt, two passions related to wonder, which have as their object what appears to us to be “great” or “small.” These two passions, Descartes adds, “are especially noticeable when we refer them to ourselves, that is, when it is our own merit that we esteem or despise” (art. 151; CSM I 383–384). In this respect, every virtuous action is related to the passion of self-esteem: when we perform it, we seek to achieve a certain good outside ourselves, but this effort is also the condition for maintaining our self-esteem.

However, we can esteem ourselves for very bad reasons, and this can lead to the most vicious and criminal actions, such as contempt for others. Therefore, only self-esteem based on reason and focused on its sole legitimate object is associated with virtuous actions: not the goods and qualities that depend on “fortune,” but only that which depends entirely on us, namely the use of our free will (on the concept of fortune, see Bardout 1996). Any other object feeds “a pride that is always very vicious” (art. 157; CSM I 385). And when we feel within ourselves a “firm and constant resolution” to make good use of our free will, the self-esteem linked to this feeling and this use defines, according to Descartes, the highest and best of all moral dispositions: “true generosity” (art. 153; CSM I 384), which is “the key to all other virtues, and a general remedy for all the disorders of the passions” (art. 161; CSM I 388; see Rodis-Lewis 1987; Shapiro 1999; Normore 2019).

5. Supreme Good, Virtue, and Contentment

Descartes could not fail to confront, sooner or later, the classic question of the “supreme good” which constitutes, or should constitute, the end of all our actions. (On the concept of virtue, see Alanen and Svensson 2007; Svensson 2011; Svensson 2020; Viljanen 2021. On the relationship between virtue and passions, see Gombay and Williston 2003, and in particular Hoffman 2003.)

This question arose during his exchanges with Princess Elisabeth about Seneca’s treatise The Happy Life (De vita beata; see Rutherford 2004), which Descartes chose as a subject for examination, though he found its meaning somewhat unclear. The essential point is indicated in the letter of August 18, 1645: bliss (la béatitude), in other words perfect contentment of the mind, “is not the highest good; but it presupposes it, and it is the contentment or satisfaction of the mind that comes from possessing it” (AT IV 275/CSMK 261); and this supreme good that one can possess (for, in another sense, “it is evident that God is the supreme good, because he is incomparably more perfect than creatures,” AT V 82/CSMK 324) is none other than “a firm and constant will to do whatever we judge to be best, and to use all the power of our intellect to judge it well” (AT IV 277/CSMK 262). Two and a half years later, the letter to Christina of Sweden dated November 20, 1647, which summarizes Descartes’ thinking on these points, will deliver no other doctrine than this one, with which the philosopher thinks he reconciles “the two most opposed and most famous opinions of the Ancients, namely that of Zeno, who placed it in virtue or honor, and that of Epicurus, who placed it in contentment, to which he gave the name of delight (volupté)” (AT V 83/CSMK 325). Indeed,

the peace of mind and inner satisfaction felt by those who know that they never fail to do their best, both in knowing what is good and in acquiring it, is a pleasure incomparably sweeter, more lasting, and more solid than any that comes from elsewhere. (AT V 85/CSMK 326)

This will also be the conclusion of the second part of The Passions of the Soul (art. 148; CSM I 382):

Anyone who has lived in such a way that his conscience cannot reproach him for ever having failed to do all the things he judged to be best (which is what I call here following virtue) receives a satisfaction that is so powerful in making him happy that even the most vigorous assaults of the passions never have enough power to disturb the tranquility of his soul.

In reality, no one can claim to behave in this life in an absolutely infallible manner. For this reason, Descartes associates the disposition of mind called generosity with what he calls virtuous humility. Virtuous humility—sharply contrasting with vicious humility, which consists “in feeling weak or lacking in resolution” and “believing that one cannot subsist by oneself or do without many things whose acquisition depends on others” (art. 159; CSM I 386)—is based on

our reflection on the infirmity of our nature and on the faults we may have committed in the past or are capable of committing, which are no less than those that may be committed by others. (art. 155; CSM I 385)

It therefore means that “we do not prefer ourselves to anyone” and forbids us to despise other people, who, “having their own free will as well as we do, […] can use it too” (ibid.). In short, it imposes a sense of moderation in self-esteem.

It is undoubtedly with “the infirmity of our nature” in mind that Descartes speaks of “following virtue” (with all that this implies in terms of effort) rather than exercising it, demonstrating it, or, even more so, enjoying it. Does not awareness of this infirmity (already mentioned in the last sentence of the Meditations) compromise access to what the correspondence with Elisabeth calls “natural bliss”? The word béatitude (bliss) is absent from The Passions of the Soul: this is because it is borrowed, rather than from Seneca, from the scholastic tradition. The more properly Cartesian term is contentment (contentement). This contentment, or inner satisfaction, is a kind of joy: a measured and serious joy, but therefore all the more profound and stable (see art. 160; CSM I 386–387; Renault 2000). In this respect, Descartes’ moral thought does not involve an unattainable ideal.

6. The Political Dimension

On the pretext that Cartesian metaphysics is built on a radical doubt that allegedly suspends all certainty regarding the existence of others, the Cartesian subject has been conceived as essentially solitary. This view is part of an optical illusion: of course, at the same time as it rediscovers its body, the ego cogitans rediscovers the society of others. And for Descartes himself, although he sought solitude in the United Provinces—without which, he said in one of his last letters, “it is difficult for me to make any progress in the search for truth” (To Elisabeth, October 9, 1649: AT V 430/CSMK 383)—his solitude was always very relative, and his communications very numerous.

In his letter to Elisabeth dated September 15, 1645, among the truths that are “most useful to us,” Descartes includes the existence of a God “whose perfections are infinite, whose power is immense, whose decrees are infallible;” the nature of our soul, “much nobler than [the body], and capable of enjoying countless pleasures not to be found in this life;” the “vast idea of the extent of the universe,” which forbids us to believe “that all these heavens are made only for the service of the earth, nor the earth only for man,” and that this earth is “our principal dwelling place, and this life our best” (AT IV 291–292; CSMK 265–266). But, he adds,

there is yet another truth whose knowledge seems to me to be very useful: that although each of us is a person separate from the others […], we must nevertheless think that we could not subsist alone, and that we are, in fact, one of the parts of the universe, and more particularly one of the parts of this earth, one of the parts of this State, this society, this family, to which we are joined by our dwelling, by our oath, by our birth. (AT IV 293; CSMK 266)

(On the Cartesian way of conceiving society and sociability, see Matheron 1974; Wee 2002; Cassan 2017; Lelong 2020.) While Descartes did not write a treatise on ethics, he had even less intention of publishing a political treatise. Politics is absent from the tree of philosophy as outlined in the Preface to the Principles: this is because, for Descartes, it is clearly more a matter of experience than of science (see Antoine-Mahut 2011; Guenancia 1983 [2012]; Pellegrin and Raymond 2024). In response to Elisabeth’s questions about “civil life,” he replied in May 1646:

I lead such a retired life, and have always been so far from the conduct of affairs, that I would be no less impertinent than the philosopher who wanted to teach the duties of a general in the presence of Hannibal, if I were to undertake to write here the maxims that one must observe in civil life. And I have no doubt that the one proposed by Your Highness is the best of all, namely that it is better to rely on experience than on reason in this matter, because one rarely has to deal with perfectly reasonable people, as all men should be, so that one can judge what they will do by considering only what they should do; and often the best advice is not the most successful. (AT IV 411–412; CSMK 287–288)

Six months earlier (November 3, 1645), Descartes even suggested that to be successful in “civil life,” the most subtle minds are not the most gifted:

Because we usually judge what others will do by what we would wish to do if we were in their place, it often happens that ordinary and mediocre minds, being similar to those with whom they have to deal, see into their purposes with greater penetration, and more easily succeed in what they undertake, than do the most refined, who, dealing only with those who are far inferior to them in knowledge and prudence, judge affairs quite differently from them. (AT IV 334; CSMK 278)

A fundamental doubt therefore undermines the classical ideal of prudence, in other words, a certain combination of good will and skill. And if the philosopher is in no way the best placed to advise princes, he will be even less inclined to determine what a political society ought to be. In January 1646, Descartes wrote to the princess:

The common laws of society […] are, it seems to me, so well established that anyone who follows them frankly, without any dissimulation or artifice, leads a much happier and more secure life than those who seek their advantage by other means. (AT IV 357)

Hence, in the Discourse, there is an express condemnation of “those unsettled and restless temperaments who, not being called by birth or fortune to the management of public affairs, are yet forever thinking up some new reform” (AT VI 14–15/CSM I 118).

Neither this condemnation nor the idea that “the chief motives of the actions of princes” are such that “unless one is a prince oneself, or has been privy to their secrets for a long time, one cannot imagine them” (September 1646: AT IV 492/CSMK 295) prevent Descartes from expressing his opinion on the maxims proposed by Machiavelli in The Prince. On this subject, he emphasizes the crucial importance for the prince of “guarding his dignity” (AT IV 489/CSMK 294), which requires keeping one’s word and obeying the laws established among one’s subjects, while avoiding “the reputation of being irresolute and inconstant” as well as that of being unjust and arrogant (AT IV 491/CSMK 294–295).

Similarly, while any attempt to reestablish a political society must be considered futile or dangerous, it is still possible to identify the dangers that threaten existing societies, as well as the rule that will enable them to be preserved in their best state. This rule is in itself very simple: that everyone should ensure that their actions remain within the limits of their office, that is, their actual powers and the duties dictated by their position (Kambouchner 2015). The letter of September 1646 on Machiavelli is entirely a dissertation on the office of the prince; and it is clear from all that precedes that Descartes himself thought deeply about the office of the philosopher. By contrast, when the pastor and theologian of Utrecht, Gijsbert Voet (Voetius), undertook to bring a case of atheism against Descartes and did not hesitate, from his pulpit, to stir up the passions of the people against anyone who did not conform to his own ideas, he transgressed all the limits of his office (as well as the “laws of charity”; see Marion 1988; Carraud 1993; Pavesi 2019). In his Letter to Voet (1643), Descartes wrote:

We are familiar with your talent as an actor, with which you take on the role sometimes of the sacred faculty of theology, sometimes that of the Academy [the University], sometimes that of the municipality, sometimes that of the entire Republic, sometimes that of the Dutch churches, sometimes that of the Prophet or the Holy Spirit, sometimes that of one of your disciples, sometimes that of another. (AT VIIIB 159; see Verbeek 1992)

Nothing is more dangerous to the peace of a state than this confusion of roles and this usurpation of others’ office.

On several occasions, Part Six of the Discourse on the Method refers to “the law which obliges us to procure, as far as we can, the general good of all men,” a law to which “all those who are truly virtuous” are bound (AT VI, 61, 65, 66/CSM I 142, 144–145). There is no contradiction between this rule and that which relates to the office of each individual. For to keep one’s actions within the limits of one’s office also means to fulfill it as best one can. One can scarcely imagine a more solid link than that which connects these words from the Discourse to the views of the Passions of the Soul on “true generosity” and “virtuous humility”.

7. Descartes and Ethics: Conclusions

Whether in his treatises, completed or unfinished, or in his correspondence, Descartes never constructed a moral theory that could be presented in a unified manner. He only provided elements or reflections on moral questions, which are not easy to synthesize, even if their stylistic unity is obvious.

Descartes’ thoughts on morality fall between two limits: on the one hand, the kind of obviousness involved in the definition of our duties, on which it seems pointless for him to dwell; on the other hand, the very large number of different situations that can arise in this life and which cannot be taken as objects of study. He also rigorously refrains from taking a position on matters of faith, especially those that have been most controversial. Thus, the problem of salvation is not a Cartesian problem.

In this a priori circumscribed space, Descartes’ contribution essentially consists of two sets of propositions: one contains the most important truths, those that we must always keep in mind; the other, the “use” of the different passions, that is, the extent to which they are useful to us and therefore the extent to which it is useful for us to cultivate them.

In the first set, the most important truth of all concerns the true foundation of our merit and the object that must, in relation to ourselves, require all our care, namely the proper use of free will. This focus on the proper use of free will constitutes, one might say, an ethical equivalent of the Cogito. Defining the good things towards which the will must be directed, and putting forward rules for their definition, is by no means as necessary.

Insofar as the whole disposition called “true generosity” relates to the proper use of free will, the study of this passion constitutes the point of articulation between the two sets of propositions. Indeed, this disposition implies a certain use of all other passions, at least those that are good. In this respect, if a choice must be made, Cartesian morality should be classified among the ethics of virtue.

As for the definition of wisdom, the problem is bound to remain. The virtue of generous souls implies an effort to judge well, but there is no guarantee that this effort will always be successful. And even if this does not concern generosity, which is essentially a firm and resolute disposition, we may be troubled by what Descartes writes about the form of indecision linked to an “excessive desire to do good:” that one must “accustom oneself […] to believe that one always fulfills one’s duty when one does what one judges to be best, even though one may judge very badly” (Passions, art. 170; CSM I 391).

Not all men are philosophers, and not all have the same qualities of mind. Nevertheless, the path to virtue is open to all. And wisdom has its degrees, which can be defined in different ways. In this respect, with the “highest and most perfect ethics” as its horizon, Descartes’ doctrine appears remarkably open.

For further overviews of Descartes’ moral philosophy, see Rodis-Lewis 1957; Cottingham 1996; Marshall 1998; Kambouchner 2008; Shapiro 2011; Renault 2019.

Bibliography

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Note: Although the entry cites the pagination of Descartes’ works in the CSM(K) edition, all translations are by the authors or revised by them.

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