Egalitarianism

First published Wed Mar 12, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Juliana Bidadanure and David Axelsen replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Egalitarianism is a school of thought in contemporary political philosophy that treats equality as the chief value of a just political system. Simply put, egalitarians argue for equality. They have a presumption in favor of social arrangements that advance equality, and they treat deviations from equality as prima facie suspect. They recommend a far greater degree of equality than we currently have, and they do so for distinctly egalitarian reasons. One prominent strand of egalitarianism promotes distributive equality: it demands that individuals get an equal share of some goods. These distributive egalitarians internally disagree on the nature of the goods to be distributed equally (resources, opportunities, welfare, primary goods, capabilities, etc.), and on the extent to which aspirations, choices, and responsibility should influence our fair share. A second strand of egalitarianism promotes relational equality: it demands that we establish communities whose members relate and stand as equals, without social hierarchies, relations of inferiority and superiority, exploitation, or marginalization. These relational egalitarians diverge on what a society of equals precisely entails—that all members relate as equals, that all those who relate do so as equals, that everyone is disposed to relate to others as equals, that no one has the power to subordinate others, or a combination of these elements. Both strands of contemporary egalitarianism are liberal: while equality is conceptualized as a chief value, a just society is also seen as one that protects an extensive set of liberal rights and provides opportunities for individuals to develop their own conception of the good life.

At the most fundamental level, egalitarianism is grounded in moral equality, also known as basic equality—the idea that humans have equal moral worth and all count the same. One prominent formulation of basic equality is articulated in the American Declaration of Independence, which holds as self-evidently true “that all men are created equal” (US 1776). Contemporary egalitarians take for granted a version of this premise. They mostly see their task, not as proving that we are equals, but as theorizing what it means to treat persons as such, given that we are equals. Egalitarians are not alone in this commitment to basic equality. Most contemporary political theorists affirm that they stand on this “egalitarian plateau” (Kymlicka 2002: 4). A commitment to basic equality is not what makes contemporary egalitarianism distinctive, therefore, and it is not what we currently have in mind when referring to “egalitarianism”. Instead, contemporary egalitarianism is identified through its substantive commitment to structuring social institutions in an egalitarian fashion—avoiding inegalitarian outcomes, and promoting equality of wealth, welfare, or power. The background against which contemporary egalitarians theorize falls critically short of that ideal, though—with large and rising global wealth inequalities, demonizing polarization, a rise of authoritarianism, and continued hierarchies of class, gender, race, ability, citizenship, caste, religion, and sexual orientation. And as people’s ability to see themselves as one another’s equals is hindered by rank, status, and wealth, the commitment to basic equality itself can seem under threat. This inegalitarian context compels egalitarians to advance, refine, and adapt egalitarian arguments, basic and substantive.

1. Arguing for Basic Equality

Contemporary egalitarianism defends social arrangements that promote equality, already assuming that we are all equals and deserve to be treated as such. But the concept of equal moral worth as such didn’t exist for much of history (McMahon 2023). On the contrary, the idea that some humans are inferior by nature was ubiquitous. Being an egalitarian thus first meant advancing arguments against the natural inequality thesis, which served as a justification for inegalitarian institutions. Arguing for equality, in other words, centrally meant affirming humans’ equal moral worth. Countless groups were deemed inferior by nature (for instance, because of their sex, race, or class), and their subjection and exploitation were justified by appeal to this alleged natural inferiority. Their interests were discounted, much like the interests of animals. To oppose inegalitarian institutions, egalitarians first refuted the science, theology, and theory mobilized to support the natural inequality thesis. Sometimes, it was members of oppressed groups who took on this task. They appealed to human reason, mobilizing experimental methods, personal narratives, scientific explorations, as well as religious and moral appeals to convince their audiences of their own equal human status, personhood, and moral value. Contemporary egalitarians are all indebted to them (McMahon 2023: 162). Here are five examples.

1.1 Confronting Social Inequalities with Rousseau

In 1754, francophone philosopher Jean-Jacques Rousseau wrote his Discourse on Inequality, one of the most influential egalitarian interventions in the history of philosophy (Rousseau 1755). Since Aristotle and Plato, the dominant view on equality was formal proportionalism: like cases should be treated alike (Plato Laws, 757 a-e; Aristotle Politics, 3.1280a10-20, 3.1282b18-23; Aristotle Nicomachean Ethics, 5.1131a10-b15). This position entailed that equals ought to be treated equally while non-equals don’t need to be treated as such. The view lends little support to a critique of social inequalities: within this framework, it makes little sense to argue that those inferior by status and nature (slaves, non-citizens, the poor, etc.) should be treated as their superiors’ equals. But for Rousseau, this reasoning rests on a logical fallacy: we witness vast social inequalities around us and take these to be a reflection of natural inequalities. In a vicious circular fashion, the naturalized social inequalities then serve as justification for inegalitarian institutions, which further cement the observed social inequalities. By contrast, Rousseau understood inequalities as the result (rather than the cause) of inegalitarian processes. We live in unequal societies because we have set up social conventions, institutions, and governments that generate and sustain social inequalities. To denaturalize inequalities, Rousseau appealed to a thought experiment: the state of nature. In this fictitious pre-social state, humans live mostly peacefully and aren’t very unequal in ability or need. Some humans are physically stronger, more intelligent, or younger than others, but not so much that they would be in a position to obtain a lot more resources or power than others. They cannot transform might into right, and there isn’t any possession that couldn’t be taken away by a slightly more ingenious person or a small gang of them. Without social convention, without laws and institutions to protect individual ownership, there cannot be much accumulation of resources or interpersonal domination. However, with the development of civil society, including the transformational establishment of private property, large social inequalities are rendered possible. We lose the natural freedom that went along with our rough natural equality. We become vulnerable to the will of those who have the most and whose property rights are protected at the expense of the subordinated poor and weak. This genealogy of social inequalities helps us adopt a critical stance on economic and political inequalities, one that sees them as unnatural and as threatening freedom. Since we are co-dependent, we cannot leave civil society, or go back to the state of nature. But our social institutions must be reformed to reduce social and political inequalities, and to ensure we can regain some kind of artificial freedom where we are not dominated or subordinated by others (Rousseau 1762b). Rousseau did not, however, view all social inequalities as unnatural. In fact, he did not apply the same critical thinking to sexual (and racial) hierarchies which he conveniently took to be truly grounded in nature: “When woman complains on this score about unjust man-made inequality, she is wrong. This inequality is not a human institution—or, at least, it is the work not of prejudice but of reason” (Rousseau 1762a: Book V [2009: 535]). (See also the entry on Rousseau.)

1.2 Confronting Sex Inequalities with Wollstonecraft

Born in 1759, Mary Wollstonecraft was a British women’s rights advocate who spent her life challenging conventions and social norms, traveling without a husband, and even moving to France during the French Revolution. She wrote several books and memoirs, including the visionary and influential A Vindication of the Rights of Woman in 1792 (Wollstonecraft 1792). In it, she took issue with the widespread view that women are naturally inferior to men. She forcefully argued that women’s characters are the product of their upbringing. From infancy, women are taught to act weak, soft, and obedient so they may one day enjoy the protection of a man through marriage. Women are taught to care mostly about their appearance and are not encouraged to develop an individual character and sophisticated intellectual faculties. Wollstonecraft understood that she had to refute the naturalization of women’s condition first to then dismantle the unjust institutions and practices justified on that basis. It is absurd, Wollstonecraft argued, to believe that a girl is naturally a coquette or a housewife (Wollstonecraft 1792: 85). After all, we can all recognize that we are profoundly shaped by the education we receive and the social conventions that surround us. Even if women were physically inferior to men, she asked, why educate them to be even weaker physically than they could be? And in any case, why should physical strength, which is otherwise disqualified as a source of virtue, be taken to prove an overall natural inferiority to men? Wollstonecraft rejected what she saw as fallacious argumentation. She regretted that men’s morals were so often corrupted by conventions. Even as they so eloquently talked of equality and freedom, they remained oblivious or silent on the sex inequalities right in front of their noses. She criticized Rousseau, in particular, for being so clear-sighted on how social inequalities arose while endorsing the very same mechanisms to explain sex inequalities (Wollstonecraft 1792: 45–48, 170–206). How could he, who thought social inequalities were the result of conventions designed to protect the powerful and dominate the propertyless, not see that women were similarly groomed to serve the dominant sex? We should not use the same bad arguments kings use to dominate the citizenry to justify the subjection of women, Wollstonecraft forcefully objected. Sex inequalities are equally injurious to morality. (See also the entry on Wollstonecraft.)

1.3 Confronting Slavery with Cugoano and Douglass

Abolitionists also understood that the denaturalization of inequalities was a key argumentative step to undermine inegalitarian institutions. Proponents of chattel slavery in the American South argued that since nature is hierarchical, and since nature is harmonious and respectable, hierarchy must be a desirable order for human societies (Calhoun [d. 1850] in McKitrick 1963). In nature, the strongest members of a species rule and dominate the weak, and that is how species survive and progress. Like women and children, slaves could not be set free, pro-slavery ideologues argued, because they were inferior by nature. It is in their interest to be governed by a master who takes responsibility for their well-being and protection. Against these arguments, Frederick Douglass and Ottobah Cugoano, both former slaves, painted a haunting picture of slavery as evil, unnatural, ungodly, and unjust, and they helped establish the equal moral worth of all humans in the process. In Thoughts and Sentiments on the Evil and Wicked Traffic of the Slavery and Commerce of the Human Species, written in 1787, Cugoano shows that scriptures support our universal humanity: they tell us that we are all sons of Noah and that all men should love their neighbors as themselves (Cugoano 1787). Slavery is the expression of brutal avarice and wickedness, it undermines sacred family bonds, and so it is ungodly. Humans’ universal dignity commands instead that no one should ever be treated as a commodity or a beast, and that all humans have the right to be their own masters. Like Rousseau, Cugoano emphasized that inequality between humans is artificial and man-made. No one is a slave by nature: they become a slave through a treacherous and ungodly act of human theft. Cugoano knew that better than anyone: he was born free and became a slave after being kidnapped as a child in 1770. In Narratives of the Life of a Slave, written in 1845, Douglass described the systemic murders, rapes and beatings slaves were subjected to. These depictions of brutality shatter the false construct of slavery as a benevolent institution. Slavery is a perpetual state of violence, rather, which dehumanizes those who take part in it: slaves are brutalized and slaveowners turned into brutes in the process. The stark inequalities witnessed in slavery are the result of oppressive institutions rather than the product of natural differences. Once more, the work of egalitarians consisted in dismantling the idea that some human beings are naturally inferior to others. What makes slaves inferior is the misfortune of being born or pressed into slavery, and the violence, material deprivation, and denial of education that come with it. Douglass stood as a living proof of his thesis, showing that access to education frees the mind and enables humans to regain the dignified status they deserve. (See also the entry on Douglass.)

1.4 Confronting Class Exploitation with Marx

Karl Marx’s critique of capitalism has had one of the most long-lasting influences on egalitarianism. In a large body of work spanning half of the nineteenth century, Marx provided a sharp analysis and critique of the exploitation suffered by the proletariat at the hands of the rising bourgeoisie (Marx Das Kapital 1867, 1885, 1894). Through a process of expropriation, dispossession and enclosure, a nascent bourgeois class gained ownership of the means of capital accumulation. To survive under capitalism, the landless class (the proletariat) has to sell their labor to the owners of the means of production (the capitalists). Capitalists make profit by wrongfully appropriating the surplus value of the proletariat’s work. Marx saw this bourgeois exploitation as a form of domination (Vrousalis 2013; Leipold 2024). What sustains an inegalitarian system designed to serve the few at the expense of the many? One answer is ideology—a system of beliefs shared by oppressors and oppressed that reflects how the means of production are structured (Marx 1867; Marx & Engels 1932). In a capitalist society, ideology rationalizes and legitimizes the dominant position of the capitalists vis-à-vis the workers (for instance, through the belief that the unemployed are lazy, that the wealthy have their wealth because they are the most intelligent or productive, that everyone can become rich if only they work hard, that wage-labor is a free relationship in which the worker voluntarily sells their labor force, etc.). To overcome capitalism, the proletariat needs to gain class consciousness—an awareness of their shared fate as dominated parties in an exploitative relationship: “The proletarians have nothing to lose but their chains. They have a world to win. Working men of all countries unite!” (Marx & Engels 1848 [1976: 456]). As an egalitarian alternative to capitalism, Marx envisioned a classless economic system in which inheritance and private property would be abolished—communism. Individuals would be more free under communism, he believed, because they would not be dominated by a capitalist employer and because their lives would not be dedicated to alienated labor. Despite all of this, there is a sense in which it is odd to characterize Marx as an “egalitarian” (Wood 2014). Marx viewed equality as a bourgeois ideal. Bourgeois equality would not get workers very far in overturning the oppression they suffer, he believed, because it is a merely political and formal value: “To clamour for equal or even equitable retribution on the basis of the wages system is the same as to clamour for freedom on the basis of the slavery system” (Marx 1898 [1985: 160]). But surely, the just society is one in which some form of equality, maybe “real” rather than formal, prevails? Not necessarily, Marx thought. The communist distributive ideal is that each should receive according to need and should contribute based on ability. This is not strictly egalitarian in a distributive sense. Moreover, egalitarian distributions entail the kind of redistributive state institutions that may not exist in a communist utopia. In some respects, the communist ideal transcends bourgeois egalitarian justice (Geras 1984; Wood 2014). There is nonetheless no question that Marx provided some of the sharpest tools to critique inequalities, helping disclose exploitative relations and exposing ideology that upholds inequalities (D. Williams 2024). These tools have roots in previous egalitarian thinkers and have influenced countless egalitarian writers that came after, including both contemporary distributive egalitarianism (especially so-called analytical marxists) and relational egalitarians (especially their critique of exploitation, oppression, and domination), as we will discuss in the next sections. (See also the entry on Marx.)

1.5 Confronting Racialism with Firmin

Racialism, also known as scientific racism, refers to the pseudo-scientific study of human races that originated in seventeenth and eighteenth-century human biology and proliferated in the nineteenth century. Natural anthropologists measured and weighed skulls, bones, and brains to generate data that supposedly backed the thesis of the natural inequality of human races. They spent their time proving and reproving, one bone at a time, that educated white men like themselves were biologically superior to non-white men (as well as to women and lower classes). Scientific racism was hugely influential politically, from the justification of chattel slavery to anti-miscegenation laws, colonialism, Nazism, and South African Apartheid. It endowed racist claims with scientific authority and served to dismiss the nascent thesis of the universal moral equality of humans as mere religious or ethical dogma without scientific foundation (Gould 1996). Modern science has now firmly disproven the thesis of the biological inequality of human races (and the existence of biological races). But even before the emergence of genetics, a contemporary of the skull measurers was able to shed light on the misguidedness of natural anthropology (Lindqvist 1995 [1997]). In De l’Égalité des Races Humaines, written in 1885, Haitian-born politician and scientist Anténor Firmin had already exposed natural anthropology as an unreliable source of knowledge. He noticed that the scientists were working in reverse: starting from the conclusion they believed to be true (the natural inequality thesis), selecting data that confirmed it, and offering ad hoc explanations whenever they encountered anomalies (or, on occasion, manipulating or misreporting the data). Firmin spent some time in the Paris School of Anthropology with these scientists. He narrates the absurdity of his experience observing White scientists measuring Black brains and demonstrating the natural inferiority of the Black race, then looking up at the perfectly competent Black scientist next to them, half-jokingly stating that he must have some White ancestors. In addition to uncovering the skull measurers’ scientific shortcomings, Firmin laid the ground for the visionary thesis that there could be no scientific basis for the concept of human races. In a Douglassian fashion, he denaturalized social inequalities, arguing that oppressors construct the brutes they pretend to discover in nature (Firmin 1885 [2002: 361]). He understood the pseudo-scientific doctrine of racial inequality as a tool of exploitation motivated by economic gain and a desire to maintain the status quo. Equality is a value and a desirable outcome, he believed. Ethical truths cannot be determined through scientific measurements. Humans are not defined by their nature: they never were and never should be. And the question of their equal worth is too precious ethically to be left in the hands of scientists and, ultimately, not one that they can ever grasp.

1.6 Towards a Modern Conception of Basic Equality

To argue for equality, therefore, first meant rejecting the natural inequality thesis—the view that some groups of humans were naturally inferior to others in quality and worth such that exploitative, oppressive, and tyrannous institutions were justifiable on that basis. It was to affirm both (i) that most inequalities are the product of remediable inegalitarian institutions and practices rather than derivative of nature and (ii) that natural variations between humans do not affect individuals’ moral worth and provide no good basis for the subjection of some humans by others. The positive formulation of basic equality is that persons have universal dignity and that they are equal in their humanhood and moral worth. Religion has historically proven a forceful ground for basic equality: we are all created in God’s image, and our souls have equal worth (Waldron 2017: chapter 5). Offering a secular formulation of basic equality has proven more challenging. Endorsing basic equality doesn’t mean believing that humans are equal in natural ability, talent, potential, or virtue. But it nonetheless typically amounts to the identification of a property that makes all human persons (and only human persons) equals. Selecting such an attribute is doomed to be controversial, and many egalitarians simply avoid the discussion or condemn it as a wild-goose chase (G. Cohen 2013: 194).

Plausible grounding attributes are thought to have the shape of a range property: while we can differ in the degree to which we hold it, we all hold the property (Parr & Slavny 2019; Waldron 2017: chapter 3). One such property might be human needs and vulnerabilities: our needs and vulnerabilities may differ, but we all have them (Caney 2005: 36). Another contender may be our capacity to reason, our rational agency. Relatedly, Rawls’s chosen range property is the capacity for moral personality—that is, the combination of two moral powers: the capacity for a conception of the good and a sense of justice. In other words, the dual capacities for autonomy and interpersonal morality: “There is no race or recognized group of human beings that lacks this attribute. Only scattered individuals are without this capacity, or its realization to the minimum degree, and the failure to realize it is the consequence of unjust and impoverished social circumstances, or fortuitous contingencies”(Rawls 1971: 506). There are problems with each potential property. Some say too little to be of theoretical or practical value: appealing to humanhood or personhood, in general, may be tautological—we ought to be treated as humans because we are human. Others seem arbitrarily speciesist, seemingly picked specifically to exclude non-human animals. Yet other properties are too narrow to include all humans, excluding those who, for example, are in a comatose state or have severe cognitive disabilities, leading to unpalatable consequences (Arneson 1999). While not being too vague, the range property must also contain enough to conjure the kind of normative content we want it to ground: that we ought to be treated in robustly just ways based on our basic equality. Picking a property finally runs the dangerous risk of lending support to the natural inequality thesis: those who display higher capacities with regard to the range property may be viewed as superior to those with lower capacities, and this fact can then be used as a justification for inegalitarian institutions (Arneson 1999). In the historical struggle for equality, those in power have always tended to pick traits that favor themselves and their social group.

As an alternative, Anne Phillips recently proposed to understand basic equality as a political commitment rather than a common human feature to be discovered in our essence (Phillips 2021; Sagar 2024). “Equality,” Phillips proposes, “is something humans make happen by asserting it” (Phillips 2021: 57). This is reminiscent of Anténor Firmin’s thought that “to believe in equality is to make a moral commitment to spare no effort in order to translate that into facts and results” (Firmin 1885 [2002: 446]). One potential issue with this alternative is that it does not offer reasons for humans, and only humans, to be the relevant rights-bearers: it simply states it. Andrea Sangiovanni provides some perspective on this issue (Sangiovanni 2017). Perhaps it is okay if we accept that no trait makes us especially worthy in the chain of beings, and perhaps our commitment to basic equality should not be understood as an expression of an equal “worth”. Rather, we should start from the somewhat more straightforward realization that being treated as inferiors is especially harmful to humans (Sangiovanni 2023). This gives us strong reasons to oppose social hierarchies without appealing to a dubious basis for equal moral worth. Phillips and Sangiovanni jointly pave the way to an alternative conception of why we ought to treat each other as one another’s equals, one which isn’t as reliant on our scalar capacities as humans.

Attempting a middle ground between the traditional approach and its rejection, Ian Carter proposes a complex “opacity respect” view (Carter 2011). Humans command the type of respect that should prevent us from looking too closely, in his view. Evaluating their abilities before we decide whether they deserve to be treated as equals is inappropriate. Carter’s suggestion interestingly combines a range property (human agency) with a normative injunction (a commitment not to scrutinize and evaluate). His work inherits some of the problems of both approaches, but it nonetheless serves as a possible middle ground. While work is needed on the topic of basic equality, there is a broad consensus among contemporary egalitarians that our attention should turn to what it means to treat persons as equals and to set up egalitarian institutions, rather than to what makes us one another’s equals. It will nonetheless sometimes be helpful to assess the extent to which an author’s perspective on basic equality impacts her substantive conception of equality itself (Carter 2011).

2. Rawlsian Liberal Egalitarianism

In his field-shaping 1971 book A Theory of Justice, John Rawls offered a systematic account of what a society that truly honors our status as moral equals should look like. Utilitarianism had been the dominant theory for more than a century. It alleges that a just society must maximize utility across persons. Utilitarianism values basic equality in its own way: no one’s utility matters more than that of another. We ought to structure institutions to secure the greatest amount of overall happiness, regardless of how utility is distributed between persons. Utilitarians would thus prefer Society 1 in which Anna has 1 utility point and Bob 100 to Society 2 in which Anna and Bob have 20 utility points each since the total sum of utility is higher in Society 1 (101) than in Society 2 (40). Rawls accused utilitarians of failing to take seriously the separateness of persons (Rawls 1971: 26–27). To truly honor our status as moral equals, it isn’t enough to value utility across persons, we must also design institutions that support individuals’ reasonable aspirations as free and equal persons. (See also the entry on Rawls.)

2.1 The Veil of Ignorance

What would social arrangements that distribute benefits and burdens fairly between individuals look like exactly? An immediate problem when debating what a just society looks like is that individuals tend to be partial. The wealthy will likely argue in favor of a scheme of justice that allows them to keep their wealth, for instance. They may portray the contingent condition of the propertyless as an expression of their inferior talent or merit and justify a limited access to societal positions and advantages on that basis. To determine what a just society truly looks like, we must instead turn to a different question: what terms of cooperation would rational deliberators who did not know what place in society they occupy come up with? Rawls developed a heuristic device called the veil of ignorance to help us establish unbiased governing principles for a just society.

Rawls imagined a gathering of parties placed behind a veil of ignorance (in the original position). The parties ignore their social class or status, race or gender, their particular talents and abilities, their specific conception of the good life, and their individual psychology. Rawls’s belief was that a fair society can only be established from an impartial perspective—one in which morally irrelevant differences in social circumstances at birth do not affect the distribution of burdens and benefits. A fair society is one in which the position of the least well-off is maximized: the worse-off cannot point to an alternative arrangement in which they would be better off. For Rawls, this logically follows from impartiality: the parties behind the veil of ignorance would want to reduce the obstacles and barriers faced by the worst-off, just in case they turned out to find themselves in that position once the veil is lifted. Rawls thought of the veil of ignorance as a method of egalitarian argumentation. It isn’t of course a literal recommendation that we rid ourselves of our connection to our worldly selves (Rawls 1971: 120; Freeman 2007: 144). We are constrained by our experiences, our partiality, and our biases. The egalitarian thrust of the veil of ignorance lies in reminding us that questions of justice can only be settled fairly when we adopt the perspective of our fellow citizens, especially those who are disadvantaged by current social institutions. Importantly, the veil of ignorance also protects liberal neutrality: it is focused on the establishment of terms of cooperation acceptable to all individuals regardless of their own beliefs about what a good life looks like (Quong 2011). (See also the entry on the original position).

2.2 Egalitarian Principles

Rawls proposed a set of lexically ordered egalitarian principles he believed his ideally situated agents behind a veil of ignorance would come to. These principles honor the general egalitarian presumption underlying Rawls’s theory: when it comes to important goods we all care about, the default should be that they should be distributed equally; when it comes to social inequalities, the default is that they are only allowed if they improve the position of the least well off (Rawls 1971: 62; Lovett 2011: 47).

2.2.1 Equal Basic Liberties

First, the parties behind the veil of ignorance would want to secure an equal set of basic liberties: “each person is to have an equal right to the most extensive scheme of equal basic liberties compatible with a similar scheme of liberties for others.” (Rawls 1999: 53). This basic scheme of liberties is meant to include a comprehensive set of freedoms, familiar from the constitution of liberal democracies: political liberties, liberty of conscience and freedom of association, freedom and integrity of the person, and the rights covered by the rule of law (Rawls 1971: 61; 2001: 114). Why would the parties choose the liberty principle behind the veil of ignorance? They want to secure their abilities to influence politics and develop and pursue a conception of the good, no matter what their political beliefs and conception of the good contain. Through a secure and extensive set of rights, the liberty principle protects citizens against majority tyranny and against being sacrificed for the greater good. It takes utilitarianism’s greatest blind spot seriously: acknowledging that each person’s life is of separate and distinct importance. And it seamlessly incorporates the insights of liberalism within an egalitarian framework. Departing from the caricature of a perpetual conflict between freedom and equality, Rawls conceptualized the two values as co-extensive and co-dependent notions, solidly grounding liberal egalitarianism.

2.2.2 Fair Equality of Opportunity

Second, the parties behind the veil of ignorance would recommend the promotion of fair equality of opportunity: social and economic inequalities “are to be attached to positions and offices open to all under conditions of fair equality of opportunity” (Rawls 1971: 42–43). Merely securing liberty rights would not be enough. After all, a life of basic liberty would still be subject to the vagaries of social circumstances. The socio-economic circumstances under which people grow up, that is, are still likely to greatly shape their prospects: their income and wealth, their job opportunities, whether they attend university, etc. The parties behind the veil would want to ensure that the paths to acquiring important social goods like income, opportunities, and social status, are equally open to them even if they are not born into a wealthy family. For Rawls, there is nothing natural or morally justified about the unequal opportunities facing people from different social backgrounds in most societies. Instead, these inequalities are the product of practices and policies that unfairly advantage some over others. What we must do is establish societies that unfairly advantage no one. A society in which “those who are at the same level of talent and ability, and have the same willingness to use them, should have the same prospects of success” regardless of their social background (Rawls 1971: 73). A just society also offers developmental opportunities to make all positions more attainable to all (see also the entry on equality of opportunity).

2.2.3 The Difference Principle

Third, and last, the parties behind the veil of ignorance would adopt the difference principle, which states that “social and economic inequalities are to the greatest benefit of the least advantaged members of society.” (Rawls 2001: 42–43). The difference principle is probably the most controversial principle of the three, but central to Rawls’ theory. With the two first principles only, society would be meritocratic: inequalities would be a result of talents, abilities and motivation rather than social circumstance. But these meritocratic inequalities, Rawls believes, would still be unfair. This is because natural inequalities in talents and abilities are as morally arbitrary as social ones: fortune in the natural lottery is no more deserved than fortune in the social lottery, he thought (Rawls 1971: 72–74). This is most obvious in the case of disability. In any case, a natural attribute is often only a misfortune or an advantage arbitrarily because of the way we choose to structure institutional contexts. Not knowing what their talents and abilities would be, the parties behind the veil would want to ensure that lacking marketable talents (whichever those happen to be in society) would not put them at a disadvantage. The difference principle takes things even further in the way of impartiality by prohibiting social and economic inequalities that do not benefit the worst-off (or, less demandingly, prohibiting those that harm the worst-off) (for discussion, see: van Parijs 2002; G. Cohen 2008, chapter 4).

The egalitarianism of the difference principle is demanding. Rawls imagined that it would make everyone better off (Rawls 1971: section 13). For instance, if a talented individual would only choose to become a surgeon if their wage was 3X rather than X, and if there weren’t enough people willing to be a surgeon for less than 3X, then the higher pay for surgeons and the resulting wage inequality would be justified, since it is thought that everyone, including the worst off, would benefit from having access to surgeons. With the difference principle, Rawls sought to avoid a caricatural egalitarianism in which the better off are “leveled down” for the sake of equality. He sought to give (market) efficiency a prominent egalitarian place. But the flipside of the difference principle is that even large socio-economic inequalities can, in principle, be defended if a reasonable argument can be made that they are to the advantage of the worse off. If the talented are not ethically minded, there is a risk they could exploit their privileged position to demand unfairly high compensation (G. Cohen 2008). Rawls restricted his attention to circumstances of full compliance, and his principles were lexically ordered such that the first two principles would already forbid large inequalities. But the difference principle still legitimizes socio-economic inequalities that later egalitarians were not comfortable with. There are also some ambiguities in how the difference principle is to be applied. For example, while Rawls’s argument leans heavily on considerations of moral arbitrariness in our social and natural circumstances, this idea is not borne out entirely in the difference principle, critics hold. In particular, they admonish Rawls’ failure to distinguish between individual members of the group of least advantaged who are badly off merely due to misfortune and ones who are badly off because they have made imprudent choices, risky investments, or failed gambles. Should both count equally among the “least advantaged”? Among other issues, these questions and criticisms are taken up by distributive egalitarians that followed in the wake of Rawls’s visionary ideas.

3. Distributive Egalitarianism

It is commonplace and intuitive to study inequality through the prism of distributions. Inequalities occur when some have less than others, and equality is reached when parties have equal amounts of some good. This is the core idea of distributive egalitarianism, a family of views that have dominated egalitarian theories of justice after Rawls. There is a sense in which Rawls’s complex egalitarianism contained the seeds of the two dominant forms of egalitarianism that came after it (both distributive egalitarianism, discussed in this section, and relational egalitarianism, discussed in the following section) (Anderson 1999; Scheffler 2003; G. Cohen 2008: 11–17). In fact, there is a sense in which Rawls’s theory was distributive and relational. Distributive egalitarians built specifically on the Rawlsian injunction to distribute the benefits and burdens of social cooperation fairly. They sought to amplify aspects that were muted in Rawls’s theory and paid attention to a broader set of internal and external endowments to compare relative “holdings”. One challenge they faced, the currency challenge (also referred to as the “Equality of what?” question) was to identify the goods we care most about (Sen 1979; Dworkin 1981a; 1981b; Arneson 1989; G. Cohen 1989). Our distributions must genuinely reflect what individuals have reason to value in a way that does not disadvantage some unfairly. Another challenge they faced, the responsibility challenge, concerned how far to take the injunction to neutralize circumstances beyond our control, including the effects of natural and social lotteries, and the extent to which personal ambitions and responsibility give rise to acceptable inequalities. (See also the entries on equality and distributive justice.)

3.1 Equality of Income and Wealth

In everyday settings, those who argue against inequalities principally focus on injustice and unfairness in the societal allocation of resources. Standard measurements of inequality, such as Gini-coefficients and Lorenz curves, register inequalities in income and wealth. Class analysis, similarly, spotlights group-based differences in income and wealth and their implications. It is not surprising that inequalities are standardly theorized as distributions of material goods. If persons have equal worth, as the commitment to basic equality suggests, it follows that they should all have a fair access to the means for living a good life. And income and wealth are means to most ends in market societies. That the prospects of children born into working-class families are increasingly outpaced by those of children born into upper-class families is a straightforward egalitarian concern. That a handful of men own as much as the bottom half of the global population is similarly injurious to morality. Income and wealth are nonetheless inadequate proxies to capture a range of important inequalities (Sen 1999). We care about economic goods mostly instrumentally, because we care about other valuable ends like respect, opportunities, liberties, and well-being. These goods aren’t directly reducible to material currency, and so focusing on inequalities in what we noninstrumentally care about seems most appropriate (Lippert-Rasmussen 2016: chapter 4). Importantly, our needs and plans in life also differ and we require different amounts and types of goods to live well. Some may need more than others to achieve the same outcome, because of an illness, for instance. Others may need more because their most important life projects require more resources. If egalitarians are committed to the quality of each separate life, then they have to go beyond economic goods and embrace a more philosophically advanced currency that incorporates goods we care about noninstrumentally and accounts for diverging needs and aspirations.

3.2 Equality of Primary Goods

It is helpful to go back to Rawls’s own preferred currency since it overcame some of the shortcomings of purely material currencies. Rawls’s primary goods are all-purpose means to a good life, regardless of one’s particular conception of the good. Primary goods include income and wealth but also encompass “rights and liberties, opportunities and powers, [and] a sense of one’s own worth” (Rawls 1971: secs 15, 67). As a currency, primary goods are an undeniable upgrade from purely material goods. But this currency also inherits some weaknesses from its predecessors. Rawls underestimates the extent to which some may struggle to convert primary goods into effective freedoms—for example, because some buildings are inaccessible to them (Sen 1979; Nussbaum 2006; Robeyns 2017a). Relatedly, some may need more primary goods than others to function well—for instance, because they need to pay for medicine or specialized equipment. These circumstances beyond our control yield unfair inequalities in actual opportunities that Rawls may have underestimated. This suggests, once again, that we may want to place our emphasis on the effective freedoms individuals are able to achieve, or the end states they are able to realize, rather than on the distributive equality of the means to these ends (Sen 1979: 219). Distributive theorists following in the wake of Rawls also pointed to some more general issues with his framework. There were concerns that Rawls’s proposal didn’t really differentiate inequalities resulting from circumstances of birth from inequalities stemming from genuine choices made by individuals (Dworkin 2000: 116–18). It doesn’t matter much, for Rawls, how the worse off came to be among the worse off. But is it unproblematic to place a surfer in Malibu who chooses to live a frugal life as being among the worst off on the same footing as an individual with a lifelong disability (Anderson 1999)? For the most part, post-Rawls distributive egalitarians thought to address these issues. These insights paved the way for a range of alternative options, including equality of welfare, resources, capabilities, and access to advantage.

3.3 Equality of Welfare

One option for distributive egalitarians is to return to the currency embraced by utilitarians (utility, happiness, or welfare often understood as preference satisfaction) and combine it with an equality function instead of a utility function (Arneson 1989). Welfare encompasses human ends that go beyond what money can buy. In other words, we care about welfare noninstrumentally. In addition, when focusing on equalizing welfare, we take into account individual abilities and aspirations, allocating resources in a way that favors egalitarian outcomes. Welfare egalitarians acknowledge the separate importance of each human life and promote a society in which all lives go equally well. So they are not vulnerable to the criticism raised by Rawls against utilitarianism. But, as a currency of distributive equality, welfare comes with many issues, including the problems of adaptive, expensive, and offensive preferences (Dworkin 1981a; Arneson 1990; Nussbaum 2000; G. Cohen 2004; Khader 2011). Some of us will have grown to need less than others to be happy, adapting our preferences to meager prospects. Others, perhaps through a privileged upbringing, may need more resources to be content. It is hard to resist the intuition that a distribution of resources that would grant more to those who were raised to expect more would be unfair. This is the issue of adaptive preferences: the fact that our preferences are an adaptation to more or less fortunate circumstances causes problems for those who want to equalize welfare as such. Even if we assume an equal society as a background, individuals are likely to develop preferences requiring different amounts of resources, and not just because their levels of ability vary. For instance, some will prefer a frugal life, while others will develop a taste for luxury. But most would find a distribution providing more resources to some so they can splurge on oysters and fine wine unjust (Dworkin 1981a). This is the issue of expensive preferences. Lastly, not all sources of welfare are legitimate. Some derive welfare from the misery of others, or from furthering racist agendas. Welfare derived from these sources is surely not one that justice should promote or seek to equalize (G. Cohen 1989; Dworkin 2000; Arneson 1989; Lippert-Rasmussen 2013). This is the problem of offensive preferences. More generally, treating actual, realized welfare as the single metric for egalitarian justice is questionable. It is not clear that we owe each other happiness rather than, say, opportunities for happiness (Arneson 1989). Each individual should remain partly responsible for getting there and we should certainly not take all preferences at face value. To overcome these issues, the currency of distributive egalitarianism could combine preference satisfaction with resources and opportunities provided in a particular setting, weighing trade-offs along the way, taking into account what others want and have, and making choices that yield morally unproblematic inequalities in the end. That’s a way to understand Dworkin’s attempt to revisit resource equality.

3.4 Equality of Resources Revisited

For Ronald Dworkin, egalitarian justice recommends distributing resources between individuals “so that no further transfer would leave their shares of the total resources more equal” (Dworkin 1981a: 186). Rather than merely distributing external resources equally, Dworkin incorporates a market mechanism into his theory to take into account individual preferences. He proposes to stick to resources as a currency, but in a way that reflects the diversity of needs and aspirations found in human society.

3.4.1 Equalizing Resources

Rawls’s preferred heuristic device was an original position with veiled parties. Dworkin’s equivalent is an auction between shipwreck survivors arriving on an island with diverse natural resources. To distribute resources fairly, all members are provided with clamshells and they bid on the resources they want. Resources are not pre-bundled since that would arbitrarily favor some preferences over others. Individuals trade with one another, based on their preferences and ambitions, until the distribution meets the envy test: no one prefers someone else’s bundle to their own. A distribution that meets this envy test is equal, properly understood. Final bundles are equal, but they are not the same. Rather, they correspond to diverging preferences and aspirations, assumed opportunity costs, and embraced trade-offs (Dworkin 1981b). To see this, consider that some people are happy to work 60 hours a week while doing so would make others miserable. These others would rather work 30 hours a week, enjoy more leisure time, even if it means settling for a lower salary. If we simply distributed benefits (such as income) and burdens (such as working hours) equally (45 hours of work for all), we would fail to take these preferences and ambitions properly into account. And we would make everyone worse off than they would otherwise be. Instead, Dworkin argues, the initial distribution is just when, and only when, no member of society envies others’ overall bundle of internal and external resources.

3.4.2 Equalizing Luck

Equality of resources is achieved once the auction has been completed and no one envies another’s bundle of resources. But it would not be long, Dworkin postulated, until new inequalities arose. Some inequalities would be due to differences in preferences—some would now want to work more than others. Other inequalities would be due to differences in talents—some would now command a higher salary or make more profitable deals than others. Finally, some inequalities would be due to differences in luck—some would fall ill, die young, or their house would burn down, while others would be spared such misfortunes. To capture these inequalities, Dworkin introduced the distinction between option luck and brute luck. Option luck refers to the outcomes (positive or negative) of deliberate and avoidable gambles while brute luck refers to the outcomes (positive or negative) of pure chance (Lippert-Rasmussen 2001). We should compensate people for outcomes of brute luck whereas outcomes of option luck should not be compensated for since they result from individuals’ choices (Parr & Williams 2021). Imagine two persons who both have a plot of land. One person uses the land to grow apples, which they sell at the local market. Another person builds a private swimming pool, in which they float around on a blowup banana, trading off the opportunity of earning income for the opportunity of leisure. The apple seller ends up wealthier than the pool floater. This inequality is not unfair, according to Dworkin, since the distribution meets the envy test. The distribution reflects the agency and exercises of responsibility of the two individuals. The apple seller made the (relatively safe) gamble that using his land to grow apples would produce a profit. It would be unfair to ask the apple seller to now redistribute the profit they made from selling apples and to bear some of the costs of the chosen lifestyle of the pool floater. Imagine, however, that both people used their plot of land to grow apples with the intention of selling them at the local market. One ends up with an abundance of appetizing apples, earning a great profit at the market. The other apple farmer, however, has a meager harvest due to circumstances beyond their control. Perhaps, their orchard is plagued by codling moths or apple scab, making the fruit unsellable. Or, perhaps, they simply lack talent in business. In either case, the inequality is due to brute luck (rather than option luck). As a result, it is unfair and should be rectified. To combat these, Dworkin proposes a complement to the auction, the hypothetical insurance market (Dworkin 1981b: 296). When confronted with brute luck, we should ask: would people have insured themselves against such misfortune had they had the chance to do so before it struck? If the answer is yes, the inequality should be corrected. This is the essence of luck egalitarianism: a fair distribution should reflect people’s choices, not chance (Arneson 2004; F. Cohen 2006; Stemplowska 2013; Albertsen & Knight 2015; Lippert-Rasmussen 2016). It should be “ambition-sensitive” but “endowment-insensitive” (Dworkin 1981b) Luck egalitarianism is one of the most influential theories of egalitarianism of the last few decades. It has spawned a large literature of proponents and elaborators. It has also been met by many detractors, many of which will be introduced in the following sections. (See also the entry on justice and bad luck.)

3.5 Equality of Capabilities

For capability theorists, what ultimately matters is our freedom to achieve valuable ends (Sen 1979; Nussbaum 2009). These valuable ends cannot be determined solely by the lights of people’s own evaluations. Welfarists and resourcists tend to tie their distributive currencies to the fulfillment of people’s preferences. But preferences are often unreliable proxies for the achievement of valuable ends. Minorities, oppressed groups, and victims of structural injustice, in particular, often adjust their expectations and preferences to their actual prospects (Sen 1995; Nussbaum 2000; Nussbaum 2006). More fundamentally, people’s preferences and ambitions are determined, to a large extent, by social norms, practices, expectations, and institutional settings. Gender norms around child-rearing, for instance, diminish women’s actual capabilities to pursue a career (Nussbaum 2000; A. Williams 2002). Granting women equal resources to men would not necessarily address the reduced capabilities they suffer. Capability theorists argue that even Dworkin’s advanced resource proposal underestimates the spectrum of obstacles that can block our path to valuable outcomes (Sen 1990; Anderson 2010a). We should focus on eradicating systemic barriers to the achievement of important ends of all kinds, including by dismantling the norms that shape and sustain inegalitarian preferences (Anderson 2014; McTernan 2014). Because of its sensitivity to oppressive social norms and institutional arrangements, the capability approach has been hugely influential in the theory, practice, and economics of development. But because the capability approach is critical of individuals’ preferences and their subjective evaluation of their own circumstances, it has often been criticized for being illiberally perfectionist or paternalistic (Deneulin 2002; Carter 2014). How should we determine what constitutes valuable ends and outcomes if not by asking people themselves what they prefer? Some respond that paternalism can be avoided by determining what capabilities we ought to provide one another through a deliberative political procedure (Sen 1999). Others, most notably Martha Nussbaum, have set out a list of cross-culturally valid capabilities that must be secured in all societies if justice is to be attained (Wolff & de-Shalit 2007; Nussbaum 2009). Still others have attempted a middle ground (Anderson 1999; Alkire 2005; Robeyns 2005; Nielsen & Axelsen 2017). (See also the entry on the capability approach.)

3.6 Conclusion

The debate on the currency of egalitarianism is ongoing. But most agree that whatever it is that should be distributed equally should not be something that only matters instrumentally, like income and wealth. Rather, it should acknowledge the importance of both means and ends, focusing on opportunities to achieve valued aims, capabilities, resources (understood comprehensively), or real freedom (Arneson 1989; G. Cohen 1990; van Parijs 1995; Lippert-Rasmussen 2016). While some praise Dworkin for sowing the seeds of luck egalitarianism by “incorporating within [egalitarianism] the most powerful idea in the arsenal of the antiegalitarian right: the idea of choice and responsibility” (G. Cohen 1989: 933), others worry that the role of individual responsibility should be minimized in egalitarian justice. Another discussion centers on whether egalitarian justice really is about distributing means and ends fairly—or, whether the point of equality is found elsewhere. These disagreements have fostered the emergence of distributive egalitarianism’s greatest contemporary rival, relational egalitarianism.

4. Relational Egalitarianism

Would contemporary egalitarianism look much different, Elizabeth Anderson provocatively asked in 1999, if it had secretly been devised by conservatives (Anderson 1999)? Anderson argued that the distributive paradigm that dominated post-Rawlsian egalitarianism missed the point of equality entirely. The subject matter of egalitarian justice isn’t an ideal distribution, she proposed. It is not an impersonal mechanism for measuring and doling out exact fair shares to mutually disinterested individuals. Instead, egalitarianism is concerned with the establishment of communities whose members stand in relations of equality. In this spirit, over the past three decades, relational egalitarians have proposed conceptualizations of equality centered on the eradication of oppression in all its forms, relegating matters of individual responsibility and distributive fairness to the background.

4.1 Critiquing Distributive Egalitarianism

Relational egalitarians level two main criticisms against the distributive paradigm—a tendency, for Iris Marion Young, “to conceive social justice and distribution as coextensive concepts” and to think of justice as “an ensemble of possessive relations” (Young 1990: 16–17). First, they critique a propensity to focus on the downstream distribution of material goods in a way that ignores or masks the power relations, structures, and institutional contexts that determine distributions upstream. Egalitarianism needs tools to bring under evaluation not just unfair distributions but also patterns of stigmatization and stereotyping, exploitative relations of production, and the social norms that sustain them (Young 1990: chapter 1). Discussions of distributive justice also often occur in abstraction from the democratic procedures from which distributions emanate. It can seem as though authors are under the illusion that distributive decisions can be made in a vacuum, apart from democratic institutions and political deliberations, and as if that would be desirable (Anderson 1999). Second, relational egalitarians worry that some central matters of egalitarian concern cannot be comprehended adequately from within the logic of distribution. At one extreme, we can think of egalitarian values like respect and recognition. These values are fundamentally interpersonal, and are only artificially rendered as distributive holdings. Even for non-material goods like rights and duties, opportunities, power, and the social bases of self-respect, for which it seems less artificial prima facie to adopt a distributive frame, important aspects of the value and social meaning of these goods are lost when conceiving of them as elements of a distributive currency. More generally, institutions, laws, and political actors can express certain intentions or messages that can be decidedly inegalitarian: expressions of disrespect, contempt, disinterest, or neglect (Schemmel 2021). Relational egalitarians worry that the value and significance of these non-material goods can become distorted when solely understood as a matter of who gets x and y (Axelsen & Bidadanure 2019). Power, for instance, is not a thing one owns or a pattern of distribution: it is a relation constructed and sustained by an institutional context. The distributive model is too static to adequately capture the dynamic and relational processes that engender inequalities (and equality) (Young 1990: chapter 1). It considers only the comparative relation between individual holdings and ignores a range of important relations that determine and influence inegalitarian outcomes: relations of marginalization, exploitation, oppression, discrimination, cultural imperialism, and so on. To make proper sense of egalitarian justice, relational egalitarians thus argue that we must look at society’s injustices through a relational lens and mostly dispense with the distributive paradigm (Young 1990: chapter 1).

4.2 Critiquing Luck Egalitarianism

Relational egalitarians also take issue with the split between outcomes of unchosen circumstances (brute luck) and choices (option luck) so central to luck egalitarian theorizing. Luck egalitarians developed this position, in part, for strategic reasons. They sought to incorporate into egalitarianism one of the most cherished value-based intuitions mobilized by conservatives, i.e., that hard work should be rewarded and imprudent choices shouldn’t. The caricature of egalitarianism that dominated the Cold War era was that of a doctrine that fetishized uniformity even at the cost of leveling down, gave everyone the same regardless of preferences, removed incentives to hard work, and encouraged irresponsibility and laziness. Rawls had done much already to incorporate efficiency into egalitarianism. Luck egalitarians took on the rest of the work: showing that egalitarianism properly understood could honor a diversity of preferences and ambitions and hold individuals accountable for the choices they make. This position was acutely criticized by relational egalitarians, though, who worried it was making egalitarianism suspiciously conservative. They leveled a range of substantive, methodological, and political objections against this incorporation of individual responsibility into egalitarianism. First, luck egalitarianism seemingly asks us to think twice before alleviating poverty or inequality. Their responsibility-sensitivity entails that we need to find out whether people’s hardship is an outcome of brute luck or imprudent choices before we intervene to rectify it (Fleurbaey 1995; Voigt 2007). For relational egalitarians, by contrast, it doesn’t matter much why people found themselves among the worse off. In a Rousseauian fashion, relational egalitarians think that a just society is one in which no one is so deprived as to be oppressed, dominated, and marginalized, and no one is so wealthy or powerful as to be able to oppress, dominate, and exploit others. Conversely, neutralizing the effects of brute luck (and only brute luck) isn’t always important. What matters, primarily, is securing egalitarian relationships, not ensuring those who suffer an undeserved loss find themselves as well off as those who didn’t. Relational egalitarians thus reject the central premise of luck egalitarianism, viewing individual responsibility as tangential to egalitarian concerns (Scheffler 2005; Anderson 2010b). Second, we live in a world whose inequalities are by and large due to unjust systems and practices (colonialism, slavery, imperialism, exploitative trade deals, exploitative contracts, racism, sexism, ableism, segregation, and so on). In this context, what help is it really, relational egalitarians have asked, to distinguish brute luck from option luck? Perhaps the disagreement is, at least partly, methodological. Luck egalitarians tend to operate at a higher level of abstraction and idealization; perhaps too high for making progress on the study of inequalities as they present themselves to us in the real world (Anderson 2015). There is also the risk, in a political climate that tends to demonize and blame the poor for their circumstances, that a version of egalitarianism centered on individual responsibility could license the often humiliating and intrusive scrutiny of the poor, for instance of those seeking unemployment or disability benefits (Anderson 1999; Axelsen & Bidadanure 2019). For all these reasons, relational egalitarians reject the prominence given to individual responsibility in luck egalitarianism.

4.3 Confronting Inegalitarian Relations

Relational egalitarians often employ a negative strategy when theorizing about justice. Rather than developing fully-fledged theories of what it positively means to “relate as equals”, they tend to critique pervasive practices, modes of relating, and systems that undermine equal standing. Iris Marion Young, for instance, theorized five faces of oppression: exploitation, marginalization, powerlessness, violence, and cultural imperialism (Young 1990: chapter 2). Individuals are oppressed, for Young, when they suffer “some inhibition of their ability to develop and exercise their capacities and express their needs, thoughts, and feelings” (Young 1990: 40). Young highlighted a range of systemic processes through which persons become dismissed, sidelined, deprived, abused, used, or erased. Distributions remain pertinent to relational egalitarians: large distributive inequalities can enable oppression, and oppression often results in large distributive imbalances (through exploitation for instance) (Schemmel 2011, 2012). However, Young argued, focusing on oppression in all its forms offers a more comprehensive and dynamic approach to equality. More recently, Sophia Moreau developed a theory of social subordination, a state of affairs in which “one social group has a standing in society as a whole that is lower than that of another social group” (Moreau 2020: 50). Those who are subordinated lack sufficient power, are stereotyped, and are granted less consideration (Moreau 2020: chapter 2). They are victims of policies that disadvantage them amidst discursive apparati that rationalize and legitimize inequality. Recent theories of domination (Lovett & Pettit 2018; Schemmel 2021), inferiorization (Kolodny 2023), humiliation (Margalit 1996), exploitation (Vrousalis 2013), and discrimination (Hellman 2008; Moreau 2020) can also be included in this general effort to comprehend equality by studying relations of inferiority and superiority.

At the core of these critiques of oppression lies the commitment to moral equality: we are one another’s equals, have a legitimate complaint against being cast as an inferior, and are harmed when treated as inferiors (Sangiovanni 2017). Relational egalitarians operate on the assumption that we are equals (Anderson 1999: 312; Bidadanure 2021: 15). This basic fact constrains how persons ought to treat, view, and relate to one another. It rules out treatment and relations that fail to respect our status as moral equals and it gives rise to interpersonal claims. Being cast as an inferior, or inferiorization, can occur at different levels: one can be viewed as less than an equal, portrayed as less than an equal, one can be related to as less than an equal, and it often follows that one is treated as less than an equal and cannot stand as such. When people are denied the consideration and material resources they deserve as a moral equal, this in turn often acts as a self-justifying and self-fulfilling prophecy, reinforcing the appearance of inferiority, which is then used to justify oppression. A variety of inegalitarian modes of relating are instrumental in diminishing people’s standing, for instance, infantilization, objectification, and animalization. They are pervasive modes of debasement that help discount individuals’ claims to be treated as equals. When people are objectified, they are presented as things without boundaries, that can be violated, used at will, owned, and discarded (Nussbaum 1995). Infantilization denies those subjected to it their maturity as persons (Bidadanure 2021: 105). The infantilized are treated as irrational agents unable to take part in deliberations. Animalization, as another example, denies a person’s human status and diminishes the importance of their interests. These inferiorizing modes of relating are great barriers to equality (distributive and relational) because they deny people’s basic status as moral equals. The wrongness of these modes of relating, moreover, would not be negated if they were evenly distributed or symmetrical. A relation in which both parties dominate, infantilize, or dehumanize each other is not egalitarian—even though, in a sense, the two parties are relating “equally” (pace Lippert-Rasmussen 2023, 2024). But treating one another as equals is more demanding and has more substance than treating others the same as the way they treat you. And a state whose institutions relate to (groups of) citizens as inferiors, and which expresses disregard or disinterest towards their interests, is unjust (Schemmel 2021: chapter 2).

4.4 Variations within Relational Egalitarianism

Relational egalitarians are often more clear on what they oppose than on their positive societal ideal. Nonetheless, the most recent wave of relational egalitarianism has further fleshed out what egalitarian relations entail and why we should establish them. And there is significant variation from one account to the other. First, the type of equality emphasized varies (Nath 2020). Some focus on equality of social standing, whereby community members view one another with respect rather than looking down upon and casting each other as inferiors (Miller 1997; Scanlon 2003, 2018; Anderson 2012; Fourie 2015; Nath 2020). For others, instead, relations are egalitarian when they are characterized more specifically by equality of power. Equality of power entails the lack of dominating relations whereby some can arbitrarily interfere in the lives of others. In other words, an egalitarian society avoids unchecked power—that is, power without accountability or democratic control (Pettit 2012; Kolodny 2014, 2023; Schemmel 2021). When some enjoy unchecked power over others, the interests of the dominated are subordinated to those of the dominant class. For relational egalitarians who object to hierarchies of power, worrisome social inequalities are thus political: they are created and upheld by state institutions, or they are the product of a failure of appropriate state regulation. Private relations, relations of standing and esteem are sometimes considered beyond the scope of justice on these accounts (Schemmel 2012, 2015). To others, workplace hierarchies, inegalitarian dispositions, interpersonal disrespect, shaming, offense, and microaggressions also belong within the scope of justice (Wolff 1998; Scheffler 2015; Anderson 2017; McTernan 2018, 2023). The question of whether to classify interpersonal relations as a site of potential injustices evokes familiar normative concerns. Counting some private matters as political could dangerously overstretch the mandate of the state. On the other hand, leaving interpersonal matters beyond the reach of politics, and beyond the scope of justice, allows a variety of inequalities to thrive and fester, as feminists and anti-racists have long pointed out (see section 5.1). Finally, some develop relational egalitarianism by modeling it on our most valuable interpersonal relations, including friendship or marriage (Scheffler 2015: section 1.2; Viehoff 2014, 2019). In such relations, equal standing and a lack of domination are insufficient. What is also needed is equal power to shape the relationship and equal weight for the interests of all in communal decisions. On accounts that seek to emulate interpersonal relations, a society of equals is characterized by genuine feelings of care and solidarity among members. These conceptualizations help flesh out different versions of the positive relational egalitarian ideal.

Another point of contention concerns why we should aim for relational equality. What is it, in other words, that makes a society of equals valuable? One obvious answer is that egalitarian relations are valuable because they have personal value—they make people’s lives better (Tomlin 2014; Lippert-Rasmussen 2018: chapter 6; Nath 2020). When people are dominated or related to as inferiors, it stifles their freedom, undermines their self-respect, compromises their flourishing, damages their self-worth, and leads to self-censorship and self-abasement (Scanlon 2003: 212; Scheffler 2005; O’Neill 2008; Fourie 2012; Tomlin 2014). The value of egalitarian relations is partly instrumental: egalitarian relationships have positive consequences for wellbeing and, conversely, inegalitarian relationships cause harm. Striving for relational equality is an important aim insofar as it helps avoid these serious bads. The value of egalitarian relations is also constitutive of other values: there can be no freedom from domination, for instance, without relational equality. Distributive egalitarians, however, might object that if relations are merely personally valuable, then what we really care about is avoiding disadvantages, such as obstacles to freedom and self-respect, and promoting certain advantages, such as self-worth and flourishing. But this looks suspiciously distributive, rather than relational (Lippert-Rasmussen 2018; Miklosi 2018; Schemmel 2021). Why not simply focus on guaranteeing a fair distribution of goods that impact the quality of relations (Cordelli 2015; Lippert-Rasmussen 2016; Gheaus 2018)? And even if the value of egalitarian relations went beyond their personal value, we would still need to know how this value is to be distributed across persons. Should everyone have equal access to relations of equality or to the freedom, self-respect, and flourishing gained through these relations? Should everyone be equally undominated or esteemed, or just sufficiently so? (Arneson 2010; Lippert-Rasmussen 2018) Despite these potential limitations, relational egalitarianism is still a considerable departure from traditional goods-focused distributive views. Trying to capture relational value entirely as a fair distribution of goods is, at best, awkward and, at worst, impossible (Axelsen & Bidadanure 2019). Suggesting, for example, that we need to distribute X amount of non-domination fairly seems artificial, not least because many such values are interpersonal: it matters, not only that some persons are dominated, but also that some are dominating. The value of relational equality goes beyond that which can be captured in terms of distributive fairness (and vice versa).

In any case, some relational egalitarians argue that egalitarian relations also have impersonal value—i.e., relational equality can be valuable independently of how it affects individual persons (O’Neill 2008; Tomlin 2014; Elford 2017; Lippert-Rasmussen 2018; Schemmel 2021). The idea that relations could have value independently of how they affect persons is sometimes considered “mysterious” (Wolff & de-Shalit 2007: 6; Tomlin 2014). But, on closer inspection, it needn’t be: just as groups and institutions can have intentions, attitudes, and beliefs that are not reducible to those of its individual members, a society can be valuable in ways that are not reducible to the value experienced by its individual members (List & Pettit 2011). When a group of people relate to each other as equals, this has value that goes above and beyond that which can be individualized and then aggregated. Take the case of the infantilization of institutionalized elderly persons. When an older person is being treated like a child (“how are we doing today”, “you look so cute with your little dress”, “come on now, if you don’t behave you won’t have dessert”, etc.), it has documented consequences on their wellbeing, health and even mortality rates. But the wrongness of infantilization goes beyond these instrumental personal harms. Even if an older person couldn’t recognize this behavior as disrespectful and was unaffected, the mere fact that persons are disrespected in this way constitutes an affront to morality (Bidadanure 2021: chapter 3; Phillips 2021: 63). Along these lines, the value of a society of equals can be conceptualized as a constraint, a deontic requirement, or a virtue (Anderson 2010a; Scheffler 2015; Schemmel 2021). Persons have a claim against being cast as inferiors and they have a claim to being treated with respect (Wolff 1998; Anderson 1999; Scheffler 2015; Kolodny 2023). A society in which people relate to each other in this manner, we might think, has a value that goes beyond the beneficial consequences such relations have for individuals.

4.5 Conclusion

The birth of relational egalitarianism from the critique of distributive views and post-Rawlsian luck-egalitarianism has been a turning point in contemporary egalitarianism. Some view it as a re-birth of a strand of egalitarianism dating back to the earliest writers in the republican tradition, and incorporating key notions in more critical, Marxist, and feminist writing, while conserving a foundation in liberal individualism. Others have also associated the rebirth of relational egalitarianism with closer attention paid to the rhetoric of organized groups representing the marginalized: focusing on power, recognition, democracy, and respect (Anderson 1999, 2014; Young 1990). The cleavage, however, between relational and distributive views should not be overstated, nor should the singularity of each egalitarian theory be flattened to fit the distinction (Stemplowska 2013). In the decades since relational egalitarianism was introduced, several hybrid accounts, which seek to combine relational and distributive elements, have been proposed (Wolff 2010; Moles & Parr 2019; Axelsen & Nielsen 2020; Phillips 2021: chapter 4). Many more relationally-minded authors insist on the importance of taking both distributions and fairness seriously (Schemmel 2011, 2021; Bidadanure 2021). Many distributive theorists have also sought to incorporate relational goods into their frameworks more or less explicitly (Stemplowska 2011; Cordelli 2015; Lippert-Rasmussen 2016; Gheaus 2018)—some even proposing a relational version of luck egalitarianism (Lippert-Rasmussen 2018). Even the fathers of luck-egalitarianism, Dworkin and Cohen, have surprisingly relational moments in some of their works, such as Dworkin’s emphasis on the importance of “treating people with equal concern and respect” or Cohen modeling egalitarianism on the interpersonal demands of individuals during a camping trip (G. Cohen 2001; Dworkin 2002; Lippert-Rasmussen 2018: chapter 8).

5. Responding to Group Inequalities

Substantive egalitarianism, either distributive or relational, starts from the premise that we are one another’s equals. We share a set of basic needs, vulnerabilities, and fundamental interests, and we all count equally. It is thus unjust, as Rawls noted and luck-egalitarians amplified, when terms of cooperation unfairly disadvantage some individuals arbitrarily—based on factors beyond their control. In the language of relational egalitarianism, a just society is one that treats all its members as equals, without entrenched status hierarchies. Large inequalities patterned on group membership are problematic for all egalitarians because they tend to reveal systemic discrimination and inequalities of opportunity based on morally irrelevant characteristics. Inequalities based on gender, race, or class are precisely the types of inequalities that principles of equality in basic liberty, opportunity, resources, welfare, capabilities, and so on, are meant to guard against. And so, there is a sense in which both forms of egalitarianism are well suited to address group inequalities like these.

5.1 Class Egalitarianism

Class, albeit more or less explicitly, has been the focus of much egalitarian theorizing historically (see sections on Rousseau and Marx for instance). And both distributive and relational branches of contemporary egalitarian thought have been influenced by this history. And yet, class analysis has not been very prominent in contemporary egalitarianism, at least in explicit form. For Rawls, a just society should maximize the position of the “least advantaged” or “worst off” in society. Several critics have noted that these notions are unduly narrow and vague (G. Cohen 2008; Sen 1992). Looking at what contemporary egalitarians have to say about class also exposes some of the limits of contemporary theorizing, especially by revealing issues with the strict bifurcation between distributive and relational views. Distributive theorists have a tendency to conceptualize the worst off in society in ways that fail to appreciate collective and interpersonal aspects of class relations (Anderson 2010a; Fraser & Honneth 2003). Conversely, theorists focusing on identity and recognition have been criticized for making the reverse mistake, deemphasizing material aspects of class inequalities when one of the main areas of concern for members of oppressed classes is that they lack resources and opportunities to access resources (Fraser & Honneth 2003: chapter 3).

Fundamentally interpersonal and collective dimensions need to be captured to make adequate sense of class inequalities (Phillips 2021: chapter 4). For Marx, classes stand on opposite sides of relations of domination—most prominently, capitalists are able to dominate workers because they own the means of production such that workers depend on them for survival. Much of contemporary egalitarian theorizing, however, tends to individualize disadvantage. For luck egalitarians, for example, one is entitled to compensation because of the brute luck setbacks one suffered as an individual—be it because of their race, disability, lack of marketable talents, or house burning down. For capability theorists, similarly, the focus is on individual freedoms, functionings, and abilities to convert capabilities into functionings. But class has an inherently collectivist dimension such that overcoming domination requires an awareness on the part of the working class that they are at the same end of the stick (Gramsci 1971). It requires class consciousness. Individualizing disadvantages runs the risk of sapping the strength of the vision of a united egalitarian front built around the understanding of a common struggle. Individualizing disadvantages, Marx might add, also runs the risk of serving to uphold the capitalist ideology according to which individual differences explain inequalities rather than systemic oppressive practices and structures (Milanović 2023; Young 1990: chapter 2).

5.2 Gender Egalitarianism

One of the most significant feminist critiques of liberal egalitarianism concerns its treatment of the family. Liberals generally conceptualize the family as a private sphere in which individuals must be free to live by their conception of the good life and transmit this vision to their children (Nussbaum 2002: 499). The problem is that the family can also foster gender hierarchy, unequal opportunities, and sex-based violence and humiliation (Nussbaum 2002: 500). It is a linchpin of gender injustice, the entrenched institutionalization of sexual difference (Okin 1989: 6). “Until there is justice within the family” Susan Okin argued, “women will not be able to gain equality in politics, at work, or in any other sphere” (Okin 1989: 4). Rawls rejected the public-private distinction pervasive in much liberal theorizing. Instead, he asserted the family’s place as part of society’s basic structure. But he nonetheless underestimated its centrality for realizing justice (Nussbaum 2002). Equality of opportunity, for instance, is undermined by the gendered family since it is where children first come to have a sense of themselves, what is expected of them, and how they ought to relate to others. Some argued that Rawls somewhat naturalized the family, conceiving of it as a pre-political structure, which led him to uncritically embrace the patriarchal family instead of prioritizing units or arrangements that would better advance the aims of fairness (Okin 1989: 96–97, 101–9, 129–33, 184–85). One clear sign of this is that participants in the Rawlsian original position are “heads of families” rather than single individuals. Rawls does little to resist the assumption that these heads of households would be men and becomes trapped by the classic public/private dichotomy (Okin 1989: 94–95). Nonetheless, Okin argues that a consistent and wholehearted application of Rawls’s principles can still challenge gender injustice. Gina Schouten goes further than Okin and proposes that gender egalitarian interventions in the domestic sphere (like subsidizing gender-equal take-up of paid and caregiving labor) can be justified even to strict adherents to liberal neutrality. How? Well, liberals care about state neutrality with respect to conceptions of the good, in the first instance, because they care about mutual respect. Inegalitarian gender norms undermine mutual respect (Schouten 2019, 2023). Social institutions built on such norms undermine reciprocal interactions, constrain choices, and frustrate essential interests of citizenship. These provide neutral political reasons to support intervention. Such interventions may even be required by liberal neutrality. Other feminists have been less optimistic about the prospects of a liberal society in addressing feminist concerns. Carole Pateman notably argued that social contract theory is deeply skewed towards patriarchy (Pateman 1988; see also Chambers 2017). A sexual contract between men precedes the social contract. This inegalitarian contract arranges for the subordination of women’s interests under the illusion of equality and freedom for all presented by the social contract. When the sexual contract is repressed, ignored, and relegated to the private sphere, it supports patriarchy rather than challenging it. It sanctions an aristocracy of labor in which women are subjects (Pateman 1988: 139). This critical tradition is more suspicious of the possibility of meaningful egalitarian contractualism that can serve feminist ends.

One aspect that was overlooked by the liberal egalitarian tradition is the intersection of gender with other forms of marginalization (associated with age, race, citizenship, ability, etc.) (hooks 1981; Crenshaw 1989). Focusing on gender inequality from the perspective of White womanhood has led many feminists to focus on women’s uncompensated domestic labor and exclusion from labor markets. However, some of the most marginalized women experience the opposite issue. Black women in the US, for instance, have been exploited as workers, often doing precarious work in other people’s homes, and being denied the opportunity to spend time with their children in their private domestic spheres. At the same time, the stereotype of the virtuous stay-at-home mother was never applied to Black women. From the Mammy, the asexual caregiver who neglects her own children, to the trope of the welfare queen, a lazy cheater who prefers a lie-in to hard work, Black women have been cast as inferiors and vilified as reluctant workers and/or bad mothers (Spillers 1987; Hill Collins 1990 [2000: chapter 6]). These oppressive images have in turn been a great barrier to the development of welfare programs for the worse off in the US (Gilens 1999). Understanding this intersection of disadvantages is key for addressing social inequalities in a way that doesn’t distort, flatten, or simplify the many faces of women’s exploitation and leads to a fuller appreciation of the set of policies needed to challenge gender inequalities. What the National Welfare Rights organization, led by Black women on welfare, demanded in the 1970s wasn’t only the right to a good job like men, for instance, it was also the right to stay home and raise one’s kids in dignity (Tillmon 1972; Nadasen 2005).

5.3 Race Egalitarianism

Black families in the US own many times less on average than White families. Our race, like our sex at birth or the wealth of the family we were born into, is pure brute luck. Hence, socio-economic inequalities patterned on this unchosen circumstance are unjust. But while distributive egalitarianism contains a robust set of conceptual resources for opposing racial inequities, it faces some difficulties in conceptualizing some significant issues raised by racial injustice adequately. First, racial inequalities are the product of a history of racial domination, segregation, exploitation, and discrimination. Subsuming racial categorization under the raw category of brute luck, alongside accidentally being hit by a falling tree, can obscure its nature, manifestations, causes, and remedies. Second, a number of pitfalls must be avoided, as epitomized by mainstream attitudes to the American ghetto (Shelby 2016: 2–3). What Tommie Shelby calls the “medical model”, for instance, in which ghetto occupants are only viewed as a social problem in need of fixing, is dangerously inadequate. Similarly, through the “downgraded agency model”, ghetto occupants are problematically viewed as passive victims in need of support, rather than as co-agents in the effort to find solutions (Shelby 2016: 2–3). Looking at the issue of racial injustice through a solely distributive lens can lead to flawed diagnoses and solutions. These models sometimes also obscure how the advantaged unfairly benefit from racialized injustices. Third, confronting racial injustice requires paying attention in a non-derivative way to patterns of representation, stereotyping and expressive harms. It requires a conceptualization of racism and wrongful discrimination (Shelby 2016: 34; Hill Collins 1990 [2000]). Relational approaches to equality can cover some of these blind spots, but contemporary egalitarianism has yet to develop complete theories of racial equality at the level of the challenges faced. Properly addressing racial inequalities also necessitates guidance on the important question of how to move forward from here: the non-ideal theory problem. One issue egalitarians have recently focused on is racial residential segregation and the prospects of various integrationist strategies (Anderson 2010b; Shelby 2016). One challenge is to confront segregation in a way that does not place too much of a burden on Black families, not unlike assimilationism risks placing too much burden on immigrants (Shelby 2016, 68–75; Kim and Walton 2023).

Finally, some theorists have expressed deeper doubts that contemporary liberal egalitarians as we know it could deal with race and racism successfully (Mills 1997, 2013). For Charles Mills, Rawls’s silences on race were not coincidental. They are structurally related to the architecture of what he calls “racial liberalism” (Mills 2017: 141). Mills partly blames this issue on the methodology of ideal theory which enables theorists to ignore the ideologies of domination rampant in the real world. Like Pateman, Mills argued that liberalism can only be redeemed and turned into a color-conscious anti-racist program if it confronts its past avoidance of the realities of racism and the historical racialization of liberalism.

5.4 Generational Egalitarianism

Does a general commitment to equality entail a specific commitment to equality between millennials and baby boomers—that is, does it entail intergenerational equality? What about inequalities between age groups (i.e., inequality between young adults and the middle-aged)? Both questions concern the temporality of egalitarian justice. Age inequalities, first, are inequalities between age groups existing concurrently at a given time (aka synchronic inequalities) (Bidadanure 2021: 1–19). Distributive egalitarianism has been dominated by a fairly common assumption which, upon inspection, yields many difficulties: the complete lives view. Complete lives egalitarianism alleges that when registering inequalities between persons, we must pay attention to their well-being levels (or fair share of resources) over their complete lives. Anna and Bob may be unequal in their twenties, but what matters is whether they are equal (or are expected to be equal) over the course of their whole lives (Daniels 1988; Gosseries 2023). This view makes sense from the perspective of distributive fairness (Bidadanure 2016). If we want to take into account ambitions, individual responsibility, and compensation, we need to think about equality across time rather than at a particular slice. A distributive inequality at T2 may be the outcome of investments or choices at T1 that make the inequality at T2 justified (Sachs 2012). And a problematic inequality at T2 may be compensated at T3 by an expected windfall of resources. What matters is to preserve diachronic equality between persons overall (Wagland 2012). One implication of the complete lives view, though, is that we are left with few resources to challenge some intuitively wrongful inequalities between young and old (McKerlie 2012). As long as those who are young can be expected to age, and as long as generational equality over time is granted, there is no complaint from the young (or old) for the temporary inequality they experience. But surely, most would think, some inequalities between age groups matter, including ageist forms of discrimination. Here, the relational approach provides some help (Bidadanure 2016, 2021: 85–119). We must relate as equals and treat one another as such continuously now, tomorrow, and over time. Relational equality is less driven towards diachronic aggregation and provides room to challenge segregation by age, discrimination by age, and marginalization.

Generational inequalities, second, are inequalities between birth cohorts (aka diachronic inequalities) (Bidadanure 2021: 1–19). Complete lives equality, already introduced, also grounds a commitment to equality between birth cohorts. The success of each of our lives matters equally, and so it is in one respect unfair, inegalitarian, if we end up with less or more through the pure brute luck of being born at a given time (Barry 1999). But applying equality diachronically is not as easy as it might seem (Meijers 2018). The more temporally distant, the harder it is to ground egalitarian duties to future people: they do not exist and do not have rights or interests yet, we will never cooperate with them, they cannot reciprocate, and there is so much uncertainty about the distant future. It may be tempting in this context to suggest that we owe distant people less than equality, and focus merely on saving enough, or guaranteeing the conditions for survival (Karnein 2022). By contrast, there is also a widely-held intuition that we owe future generations (or at least the next generation) a better life than our own, i.e. more than equality. But more than equality seems supererogatory and it could even be unjust. A positive deviation from equality for the next generation is allowed if it occurs through a conscious decision of the upstream generation. In that case, the inequality between G1 and G2 happens through option luck, not brute luck, and so it is no concern that G1<G2 (Bidadanure 2021: 45). This kind of “generational accounting”, however, can seem contrived. As an alternative, we could articulate intergenerational equality in terms of respect, non-domination and non-marginalization. It is a duty not to exploit the relational vulnerability they have toward us by virtue of them not existing and being unable to influence contemporary political decisions. The requirements of relational equality with regards to generations, however, may strike some as somewhat underspecified and, perhaps, non-committal compared to the distributive fairness approach (Bidadanure 2016). (See also the entry on intergenerational justice.)

5.5 Global Egalitarianism

Contemporary discussions of egalitarianism have mostly been framed as confined to societies or states. Rawls’s principles of justice, debates about egalitarian currency, and the schism between relational and distributive views were all, at least originally, conceived as outlining what an egalitarian national society should look like. Some of these egalitarian theorists were originally silent on global justice, others articulated duties of beneficence and humanitarianism (not of justice) at the global level, while others proposed sufficientarian principles at the global level. But in a world with a history of colonial exploitation, imperial domination, and rising global inequality, why would egalitarian obligations be confined to the state and not extend globally? One answer suggests that it is because state institutions have a special and profound impact on our lives. Institutions that impact people’s opportunities in this way require special justification. And, for the state to be justifiable to all its subjects, its institutions must be shaped by egalitarian principles of some kind (Rawls 1971: 7). Another answer points to salient features of national communities, like the presence of elaborate tax-collecting institutions, oversight over resources, the presence of a constituted demos, and a national political culture. Global egalitarians have tended to respond to those seeking to limit egalitarian principles to the domestic sphere that the global level isn’t sufficiently different from the national level to motivate a deep disconnect in our egalitarian commitments (J. Cohen & Sabel 2006; Abizadeh 2007; Valentini 2011a; 2014; Ypi 2011; Nath 2015). Global institutions have a relevantly similar impact on our daily lives, especially on the lives of those who reside in low-income countries (Beitz 1979; Wenar 2008; Casal 2011). These institutions can actively harm citizens of poorer countries, creating and maintaining circumstances of deprivation in poor states (Pogge 2005; Wenar 2008). Others point to the existence of coercively upheld borders which profoundly impact the lives of non-citizens by preventing them from migrating to societies in which they would enjoy better life prospects (Van Parijs 2017). There isn’t a global state, demos, or tax-collecting organization (yet) but if global institutions have such a profound impact on our livelihoods, then they are subject to the same justificatory requirements as state institutions; and they need to be governed by egalitarian principles. In any case, the absence of more advanced global institutions isn’t enough to deny the applicability of egalitarianism to the global level (Valentini 2011b). Perhaps justice and equality precisely require the establishment and development of such institutions (Axelsen 2019; Ronzoni 2009; Ypi 2011). The brute luck of being born in one country instead of another shouldn’t dictate one’s life prospects any more than whether one is born into a wealthy family or not, global egalitarians argue (Tan 2004; Caney 2005; Brock 2009). After all, regardless of nationality, culture, and citizenship, persons share a set of basic needs, vulnerabilities, and interests (Doyal & Gough 1991; Nussbaum 2000; Wolff & de-Shalit 2007; Brownlee 2020). And these commonalities, our universal humanity and our legitimate differences, are relevantly similar to those used to justify egalitarianism in a domestic setting (Caney 2005; Appiah 2006). (See also the entries on global justice and international distributive justice.)

6. Egalitarianism’s Closest Competitors

Egalitarianism, in its contemporary form, was mostly developed in discussion with and response to libertarianism and utilitarianism. Egalitarians place equality, rather than freedom or utility, at the center of their theorizing. It is the chief value, the “sovereign virtue”, of a just political system (Dworkin 2000). But most egalitarians have found ways to incorporate other values into their theorizing, turning freedom, utility, responsibility, efficiency, community, respect, and so on, into constitutive features of egalitarian justice. Egalitarians are also often pluralists: although their conceptions of justice are centered on equality, they believe that other moral values matter to justice, sometimes even in a way that trumps egalitarian requirements. Even if, say, taking all children away from their parents at an early age and institutionalizing them in state-run facilities would greatly promote equality of opportunity, the guarantee of certain fundamental liberal rights and the respect of individuals’ core preferences and interests trumps the egalitarian credentials of such interventions. Most conceptions of egalitarianism have internal resources to block such a policy without having to appeal to a moral value external to egalitarian justice though. Egalitarianism also has some close theoretical competitors, built around a similar set of values but recommending different principles of justice. Presenting these theories helps illuminate some foundations and implications of egalitarianism.

6.1 Prioritarianism

Imagine you could choose to benefit either the very worst-off person in society or a member of the middle class. The egalitarian thing to do, surely, is to benefit the worst-off, ideally raising them to the level of their co-citizen. As Derek Parfit has pointed out, though, another option is, seemingly, equivalently egalitarian: removing resources from the middle-class person until they are as badly off as the worst-off person in society, leaving the two with equal prospects (Parfit 1997). After all, this too would get us to an equal distribution. Intuitively, however, this leveling-down solution seems objectionable. This suggests, for Parfit, that the core intuition that grounds theories of distributive fairness is, in fact, not equality but priority: that the worst-off should be given priority when distributing societal advantages, or in other words, that benefits matter more “the worse off these people are” (Parfit 1997: 213). Leveling down is not helpful to the worse off, and so priority is not susceptible to the same objection. The move from equality to priority is not without costs, however. As some have argued, prioritarianism has difficulties making sense of how our intuitions differ in interpersonal and intrapersonal cases of prioritization. When choosing between different possible outcomes on behalf of several people, simply seeking to maximize utility comes with intuitive problems. Doing so violates the separateness of persons, as Rawls would have said. Instead, it looks more attractive to choose the option that avoids the worst outcome—i.e., to give priority to the worst-off. When one person chooses between two uncertain paths, on the contrary, it is often more intuitively compelling to make the choice that maximizes utility, rather than giving priority to avoiding the worst outcome (Otsuka & Voorhoeve 2009). And it is not clear that the move from equality to priority is needed to survive the leveling down objection in any case. First, leveling down can be a reasonable policy response to societal inequalities in certain contexts (Temkin 2000). As relational egalitarians have pointed out, many of the most important inequalities have to do with social standing and political power. In these cases, decreasing someone’s power, or lowering their (superior) standing, can seem more legitimate. More generally, many important societal goods are positional or have positional aspects, meaning that their value is determined by how much we have compared to others (Brighouse & Swift 2006; Nielsen & Axelsen 2017). This is true of voting rights, education, job experience, and legal aid, for instance, whose value depends very much on what others have. And in such cases, since no absolute value is lost, it may be less objectionable to level down (Axelsen & Nielsen 2015; Harel Ben-Shahar 2018). If some have two votes and others have one, for instance, ensuring everyone has one vote only is a suitable intervention. Lastly, egalitarians concern themselves with the equalization of something worthwhile—valuable means and important ends. They can plausibly deny that destroying such valuable means and ends to ensure equality is in line with their most fundamental commitments (Christiano & Braynen 2008). In any case, the distance between egalitarianism and prioritarianism should not be overstated. Both views tell us to worry about the prospects of the worst off for the same reason: everyone should have a fair opportunity for pursuing their conception of the good life.

6.2 Sufficientarianism

What matters to justice, according to sufficientarians, is not priority or equality: it is sufficiency, i.e. that everyone has enough (Anderson 2010a; Axelsen & Nielsen 2015; Crisp 2003; Frankfurt 1987; Huseby 2010; Shields 2012, 2016). When faced with a choice between benefiting the rich and the super-rich, both prioritarians and egalitarians will tell us to benefit the rich. But, sufficientarians argue, the right answer is to deny that either group has a claim of justice on additional benefits (Crisp 2003). They already have (more than) what justice requires and, therefore, they are not in a position to make further claims on their fellow citizens. Distributive egalitarians and prioritarians see justice as a question of how to adjudicate between competing claims on scarce resources, deciding whose claim is the weightier. But in the real world, many of the claims brought before the state are made by those who already hold a relatively large share of society’s resources: middle-class parents who want better schools for their already well-off children, wealthy individuals who want tax cuts, or highly-skilled workers demanding higher pay. These claims distract us from the real injustices of the world, sufficientarian argue, which concern the large majority of individuals who do not have enough to thrive and are under duress. Theories of sufficiency are built around two related theses. The positive thesis holds that it is especially important to ensure that people are brought above a certain threshold (Casal 2007), while the negative thesis holds that above this threshold, inequalities are irrelevant from the point of view of justice (Axelsen & Nielsen 2015; Casal 2007; Huseby 2020). The most controversial component of sufficientarianism, and the elements around which most objections are built, is the negative thesis. Critics have argued that it is difficult to imagine a threshold that matters so much that we should give absolute priority below it and no justice-relevant considerations above it. The sufficiency view, in this respect, seems both arbitrary and implausibly indifferent about inequalities above the threshold (Goodin 1987; Temkin 2003a, 2003b; Arneson 2005; Casal 2007; Knight 2022). Sufficiency theorists, in response to these objections, have refined their theories, incorporating elements of egalitarianism, and suggesting for instance that, given that many goods are positional, granting enough for everyone requires a range of egalitarian interventions (Axelsen & Nielsen 2015; Hupfer 2019; Huseby 2010; Shields 2016). As with prioritarianism, however, one should not overstate the distance between egalitarianism and sufficientarianism. Sufficientarians, after all, hold that we should ensure everyone is sufficiently free to lead a good life, and that we should be equally concerned with everyone’s ability to do so. Moreover, many relational egalitarians are in fact sufficientarians of some kind, since they believe that having enough is adequate for standing as an equal or avoiding relations of domination (Anderson 1999).

6.3 Limitarianism

Limitarianism is a very recent theory that, it might be said, provides an inverted mirror image of sufficiency: rather than focusing on those who have too little, limitarianism focuses on those who have too much (Axelsen & Nielsen 2024; Robeyns 2017b, 2022; Timmer 2021). Limitarianism sets a limit of justice on how many resources people are allowed to hold. It is not meant as a free-standing theory of justice—it is not enough that no one is extremely wealthy for justice to obtain (since this could be true of a world with great inequalities and one with desperate poverty). Consequently, limitarianism isn’t a competitor to egalitarianism as much as it is a companion principle. In some sense, limitarian scholars are mainly motivated by how extreme wealth impacts (political) inequality and insufficiency (Robeyns 2019). This proximity to other distributive principles has, however, also led critics to question the distinctiveness of limitarianism (Volacu & Dumitru 2019; Halldenius 2022; Huseby 2022; Nielsen & Axelsen 2022). But the core idea of limitarianism is that there is something particularly troubling about a society in which some hold extreme wealth while others have too little, and this cannot be fully captured by equality or sufficiency. A society that allows individuals to retain extreme wealth, adding little to nothing to their well-being, under circumstances of injustice, sends a message of special disrespect toward its worse-off members (Robeyns 2017b; Timmer 2021; Axelsen & Nielsen forthcoming). Its distinctiveness comes from the morally appalling set of circumstances that is the co-existence of opulence and deprivation.

7. Egalitarian policies

7.1 Developing an Egalitarian Toolkit

Egalitarian philosophers often focus on ideal theorizing and neglect policy discussions. But egalitarian arguments have myriad implications for a range of policy areas including taxation, labor markets, workplaces, healthcare, housing, education and democratic institutions. Egalitarians are naturally suspicious of, and usually opposed to, large inequalities, and they implicitly or explicitly recommend institutions that reduce or mitigate inequalities. We can refer to these recommendations as forming the content of an egalitarian toolbox (or toolkit) of policies which may include a universal basic income, affirmative action and anti-discrimination policies, a job guarantee, universal preschools, affordable housing, universal healthcare, wealth tax, integration measures, and reparations, to name only a few (Anderson 2008; White 2015). Although egalitarians all reject the inegalitarian status quo, differences within egalitarianism can lead to different approaches to what egalitarian policy-making should look like. The chosen currency (e.g., welfare or resources), delineated scope (e.g., domestic or global), extent to which a theory is starting gate or outcome oriented, or degree to which individual responsibility is emphasized, are all factors that can affect policy recommendations. Relational egalitarians, for instance, are taken to advocate for both policies that raise the floor for all, regardless of what explains people’s level of disadvantage, and policies that set strict limits to wealth accumulation, regardless of how this wealth has been accumulated—the aim being principally to undermine hierarchies of power and esteem, and promote egalitarian relations. Luck egalitarians, by contrast, want to honor the moral difference between brute luck inequalities and option luck inequalities. This could shape the way we understand fair interventions in the context of employment, health or education (Roemer 1993; Albertsen 2024). The reduction of health inequalities that are the result of unchosen circumstances (due to genetic differences), for instance, may be prioritized over health inequalities that are the result of unhealthy habits (not exercising or smoking cigarettes), for instance (Segall 2010; Albertsen 2024). This said, given that most significant social inequalities can be traced back to forms of brute luck one way or another (i.e. the social determinants of unhealthy habits), luck egalitarians could coherently make policy recommendations that do not differ much in practice from relational egalitarian policies.

More generally, egalitarianism sheds light on the kinds of economic systems that would be best suited to egalitarian ends. Rawls, for instance, supported property-owning democracy over welfare capitalism (and more straightforwardly over laissez-faire capitalism and state socialism) (Rawls 2001: 135–140). Welfare capitalism requires constant interventions to save the worse off from the inegalitarian outcomes generated by capitalist markets and saps the possibility of genuine egalitarian solidarity with the worse off by framing them as pitiable victims of misfortune (O’Neill & Williamson 2012). Rawls’s property-owning democracy would distribute productive assets and opportunities more equally to prevent the emergence of monopolies (O’Neill & Williamson 2012). This form of pre-distribution can help secure egalitarian positions from the get-go, avoiding the need for constant corrections of inegalitarian outcomes.

7.2 Egalitarianism and Basic Income

There are countless policies that could be included in the egalitarian toolkit. Universal Basic Income (UBI) is an example we single out here as a good candidate. A cash grant given to all members of a community without work requirements and with no strings attached, UBI would do a great deal to build a robust floor for all to stand on (Bidadanure 2019). UBI and its close cousins (the negative income tax, cash dividends, and guaranteed income) have a long legacy, starting with Thomas Paine and Charles Fourier, and with illustrious proponents since like James Meade, Milton Friedman, and Martin Luther King Jr. Since the 1980s, political philosophers have actively debated the moral adequacy of universal basic income mostly as an instrument of freedom (Van Parijs 1995). Basic income grants more freedom of choice than most traditional welfare programs which tend to be given in kind, restricting how benefits can be spent (e.g. US food stamps or housing vouchers), and requiring that recipients actively look for work (e.g. UK job seekers allowance), that they work (e.g. US EITC), or, on the contrary, that they don’t work (e.g. disability benefits or employment insurance). Since it is paid to everyone unconditionally, a basic income program could be administered without requiring an extensive set of bureaucratic processes and practices. This is freedom-enhancing for recipients because it leaves them less vulnerable to the intrusiveness and discretionary power of state bureaucrats. UBI also protects liberal neutrality by not discriminating against those who choose unproductive lifestyles (Van Parijs 1991).

There is an obvious sense in which UBI’s potential gains for freedom are also gains for equality. UBI helps ensure that no one is so poor as to be dominated by others, which is a traditional promise of egalitarianism (see section on Rousseau). Basic income promotes exit options, bargaining power, and an increased ability to make free choices while being less vulnerable to bureaucrats’ discretionary power. It also promotes relational equality, equality of welfare, and equality of opportunity, at least. A more direct and efficient way to raise the floor would be through means-tested or targeted benefits to the worst-off. Relational egalitarianism, however, offers an important defense of the universal provision of basic income: in a climate in which unemployment and benefits recipients are stigmatized and demonized, means-tested benefits place a target on recipients’ backs (Bidadanure 2019). UBI normalizes public assistance instead, making it much harder to scapegoat benefits recipients for political gain, protecting their social status and standing. It delivers a distributive benefit without a relational cost, in other words. There are also gender and race egalitarian arguments for basic income. But the case on these grounds is not as straightforward. The puzzle is to articulate how a policy that grants cash to all (rather than exclusively to women, or racial minorities) can be thought of as reducing gender or racial inequalities. A clear alternative would be caregiver grants and reparations, respectively (Schouten 2019, 2021). Basic income enables individuals to increase caregiving time, either by reducing work hours or by taking time off work to care for family members. It thus has an important role to play toward the goal of recognizing, remunerating, and perhaps even encouraging, care work. But because UBI isn’t tied to care work specifically either, the risk of disincentivizing women from paid employment (an outcome that conflicts with gender egalitarianism) is likely not as great as with caregiver grants. So, although from a purely distributive perspective caregiver grants might fare better in reducing gender inequalities, universal benefits could achieve the same goal of empowering caregivers without reinforcing gender inegalitarian social norms of care (Zelleke 2008). On the racial justice side, there is a long history of groups like the National Welfare Rights Organization, the Black Panther Party, and Black Lives Matter supporting versions of basic income. UBI can help reduce the racial wealth gap indirectly: basic income goes to everyone, but those wealthiest would pay more into the system through progressive taxation. Those worse off economically (including worse-off racial minorities) would benefit disproportionately from the program. There are advantages to this indirect form of addressing racial inequalities as compared to more targeted programs. Countries with targeted benefits have a history of stereotyping of benefits recipients. In the US, these stereotypes are highly gendered and racialized. The welfare queen stereotype, for instance, was carefully manufactured in the 80s to undermine support for welfare, with persisting results (Hill Collins 1990 [2000]). So, normalizing public assistance could help undermine the racialized hierarchy of esteem that often accompanies targeted cash programs. These are some of the many reasons UBI might be thought of as part of the egalitarian toolkit.

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Other Internet Resources

  • Equality and Responsibility, by John Roemer, with responses from T. M. Scanlon, Robert M. Solow, Samuel Scheffler, Richard A. Epstein, Elizabeth Fox-Genovese, Eric Maskin, Arthur Ripstein, S. L. Hurley, and Nancy L. Rosenblum, Boston Review, April/May 1995, Vol. XX No. 2.
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Acknowledgments

The authors would like to acknowledge Rioghnach Theakston, Prach Panchakunathorn, and Miikka Jaarte for their outstanding research assistance at NYU and Stanford. We also want to thank the SEP editors and anonymous reviewer, as well as our colleagues Kasper Lippert-Rasmussen, Martin O’Neill, Anne Phillips, Søren Flinch Midtgaard, Gina Schouten, Bruno Leipold, and Daniel Viehoff for their generous feedback on specific sections of the entry.

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Juliana Bidadanure <jub206@nyu.edu>
David Axelsen <d.v.axelsen@essex.ac.uk>

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