Foreknowledge and Free Will

First published Tue Jul 6, 2004; substantive revision Tue Feb 17, 2026

Fatalism is the thesis that human acts occur by necessity and hence are unfree. Theological fatalism is the thesis that infallible foreknowledge of a human act makes the act necessary and hence unfree. If there is a being who knows the entire future infallibly, then no human act is free.

Fatalism seems to be entailed by infallible foreknowledge by the following informal line of reasoning:

For any future act you will perform, if some being infallibly believed in the past that the act would occur, there is nothing you can do now about the fact that he believed what he believed since nobody has any control over past events; nor can you make him mistaken in his belief, given that he is infallible. Therefore, there is nothing you can do now about the fact that he believed in a way that cannot be mistaken that you would do what you will do. But if so, you cannot do otherwise than what he believed you would do. And if you cannot do otherwise, you will not perform the act freely.

The same argument can be applied to any infallibly foreknown act of any human being. If there is a being who infallibly knows everything that will happen in the future, no human being has any control over the future.

This theological fatalist argument creates a dilemma for anyone who thinks it important to maintain both (1) that there is a deity who infallibly knows the entire future, and that (2) human beings have free will in the strong sense usually called libertarian. But it has also fascinated many who have not shared either of these commitments, because taking the argument’s full measure requires rethinking some of the most fundamental questions in philosophy, especially ones concerning time, truth, and modality. Those philosophers who think there is a way to consistently maintain both (1) and (2) are called compatibilists about infallible foreknowledge and human free will. Compatibilists must either identify a false premise in the argument for theological fatalism or show that the conclusion does not follow from the premises. Incompatibilists accept the incompatibility of infallible foreknowledge and human free will and deny either infallible foreknowledge or free will in the sense targeted by the argument.

1. The argument for theological fatalism

There is a long history of debate over the soundness of the argument for theological fatalism, so its soundness must not be obvious. Nelson Pike (1965) gets the credit for clearly and forcefully presenting the dilemma in a way that produced an enormous body of work by both compatibilists and incompatibilists, leading to more careful formulations of the argument.

A precise version of the argument can be formulated as follows: Choose some proposition about a future act that you think you will do freely, if any act is free. Suppose, for example, that the telephone will ring at 9 am tomorrow and you will either answer it or you will not. So it is either true that you will answer the phone at 9 am tomorrow or it is true that you will not answer the phone at 9 am tomorrow. The Law of Excluded Middle rules out any other alternative. Let T abbreviate the proposition that you will answer the phone tomorrow morning at 9, and let us suppose that T is true. (If not-T is true instead, simply substitute not-T in the argument below).

Let “now-necessary” designate temporal necessity, the type of necessity that the past is supposed to have just because it is past. This type of necessity plays a central role in the argument and we’ll have more to say about it in sections 2.4, 2.5, 2.7, and 5, but we can begin with the intuitive idea that there is a kind of necessity that a proposition has now when the content of the proposition is about something that occurred in the past. To say that it is now-necessary that milk has been spilled is to say (among other things) that nobody can do anything now about the fact that the milk has been spilled.

Let “God” designate a being who has infallible beliefs about the future, where to say that God believes p infallibly is to say that God believes p and it is not possible that God believes p and p is false. It is not important for the logic of the argument that God is the being worshiped by any particular religion, but the motive to maintain that there is a being with infallible beliefs is usually a religious one.

One more preliminary point is in order. The dilemma of infallible foreknowledge and human free will does not rest on the particular assumption of foreknowledge and does not require an analysis of knowledge. Most contemporary accounts of knowledge are fallibilist, which means they do not require that a person believe in a way that cannot be mistaken in order to have knowledge. She has knowledge just in case what she believes is true and she satisfies the other conditions for knowledge, such as having sufficiently strong evidence. Ordinary knowledge does not require that the belief cannot be false. For example, if I believe on strong evidence that classes begin at my university on a certain date, and when the day arrives, classes do begin, we would normally say I knew in advance that classes would begin on that date. I had foreknowledge about the date classes begin. But there is nothing problematic about that kind of foreknowledge, because events could have proven me wrong even though, as events actually turned out, they didn’t prove me wrong. Ordinary foreknowledge does not threaten to necessitate the future because it does not require that when I know p it is not possible that my belief is false. The key problem, then, is the infallibility of the belief about the future, and this is a problem whether or not the epistemic agent with an infallible belief satisfies the other conditions required by some account of knowledge, such as sufficient evidence. So long as an agent has an infallible belief about the future, the problem arises.

Using the example of the proposition T, the argument that infallible foreknowledge of T entails that you do not answer the telephone freely can be formulated as follows:

Basic Argument for Theological Fatalism

(1)
Yesterday God infallibly believed T. [Supposition of infallible foreknowledge]
(2)
If E occurred in the past, it is now-necessary that E occurred then. [Principle of the Necessity of the Past]
(3)
It is now-necessary that yesterday God believed T. [1, 2]
(4)
Necessarily, if yesterday God believed T, then T. [Definition of “infallibility”]
(5)
If p is now-necessary, and necessarily (p → q), then q is now-necessary. [Transfer of Necessity Principle]
(6)
So it is now-necessary that T. [3,4,5]
(7)
If it is now-necessary that T, then you cannot do otherwise than answer the telephone tomorrow at 9 am. [Definition of “necessary”]
(8)
Therefore, you cannot do otherwise than answer the telephone tomorrow at 9 am. [6, 7]
(9)
If you cannot do otherwise when you do an act, you do not act freely. [Principle of Alternate Possibilities]
(10)
Therefore, when you answer the telephone tomorrow at 9 am, you will not do it freely. [8, 9]

This argument is formulated in a way that makes its logical form as perspicuous as possible, and there is a consensus that this argument or something close to it is valid. That is, if the premises are all true, the conclusion follows.

The compatibilist about infallible foreknowledge and free will must therefore find a false premise. There are four premises that are not straightforward substitutions in definitions: (1), (2), (5), and (9). All four of these premises have come under attack in the history of discussion of theological fatalism. Aristotle’s concern about future contingent truth has motivated an increasing number of compatibilists to challenge premise (1). Boethius and Aquinas also denied premise (1), but on the grounds that God and his beliefs are not in time, a solution that has always had some adherents. William of Ockham rejected premise (2), arguing that the necessity of the past does not apply to the entire past, and God’s past beliefs are in the part of the past to which the necessity of the past does not apply. This approach to the problem was revived early in the debate stirred up by Pike’s article, and has probably attracted more attention, in its various incarnations, than any other solution. There are more radical responses to (2) as well. Premise (5) has rarely been disputed and is an analogue of an axiom of modal logic, but it may have been denied by Duns Scotus and Luis de Molina. Although doubts about premise (9) arose relatively late in the debate, inspired by contemporary discussions of the relation between free will and the ability to do otherwise, the denial of (9) is arguably the key to the solution proposed by Augustine.

In addition to the foregoing compatibilist solutions, there are two incompatibilist responses to the problem of theological fatalism. One is to deny that God (or any being) has infallible foreknowledge. The other is to deny that human beings have free will in the libertarian sense of free will. These responses will be discussed in section 3. The relationship between theological fatalism and logical fatalism will be discussed in section 4. In section 5 we will consider whether the problem of theological fatalism is just a theological version of a more general problem in metaphysics that isn’t ultimately about God, or even about free will.

2. Compatibilist responses to theological fatalism

2.1 The denial of future contingent truth

One response to the dilemma of infallible foreknowledge and free will is to deny that the proposition T can be true, on the grounds that no proposition about the contingent future is true: such propositions are either false (given Bivalence), or neither true nor false. This response rejects the terms in which the problem is set up. Since God wouldn’t believe a proposition unless it were true, premise (1) is, on this account, a non-starter. The idea behind this response is usually that propositions about the contingent future become true when and only when the event occurs that the proposition is about. If the event does not occur at that time, then the proposition becomes false. This seems to have been the position of Aristotle in the famous Sea Battle argument of De Interpretatione IX, where Aristotle is concerned with the implications of the truth of a proposition about the future, not the problem of infallible knowledge of the future. But some philosophers have used Aristotle’s move to solve the dilemma we are addressing here.

This approach to the problem had already been endorsed, three years before Pike’s seminal article, by A.N. Prior (1962), but it received little initial attention. John Martin Fischer’s first anthology of essays on the problem (1989) does not contain a single paper advocating this solution. It wasn’t until the 1980s, when it was defended by Joseph Runzo (1981), Richard Purtill (1988), and J.R. Lucas (1989), that it began to gain traction in the debate. Alan Rhoda, Gregory Boyd, and Thomas Belt (2006) have argued for the “Peircean” semantics favored by Prior (1967, 113–36), on which the predictive use of the word ‘will’ carries maximal causal force and all future contingents turn out false, while Dale Tuggy (2007) has defended the position that future contingents are neither true nor false. Another supporter of the all-future-contingents-are-false solution to the problem of theological fatalism is Patrick Todd (2016a), whose book (2021) offers a vigorous defense of this approach against various objections. Many of those who reject future contingent truth base their position, at least in part, on presentism, according to which only the present exists. Statements about the future, especially the contingent future, would then arguably lack the grounding necessary for truth. D.K. Johnson (2009) has taken up this solution to both logical and theological fatalism, as has Dean Zimmerman (2008). Not all presentists find fault with premise (1) of the argument, however. William Lane Craig (1987), for example, is a presentist defender of the compatibility of divine foreknowledge and libertarian freedom who affirms Bivalence along with the existence of future contingent truths. Michael Rea (2006) and Philip Swenson (2016) argue that this position is unavailable, while Bradley Rettler (2023) responds to their arguments. A measure of how much the debate has shifted in this direction is that Fischer’s second anthology (Fischer and Todd 2015) contains an entire section on “The Logic of Future Contingents.” The connection between this solution and “open theism” will be discussed in section 3.

While there is considerable prima facie appeal to the idea that statements about the contingent future aren’t yet true, and that they become true only when the future arrives, both the semantic and the metaphysical justifications for this idea can be challenged. A semantics that collapses truth into necessity and falsehood into impossibility, at least for propositions about the future, may be insufficiently attentive to people’s actual use of the predictive ‘will’, not to mention logically problematic. The true futurist theory (“the thin red line”), allowing for future contingent truth, is defended by Øhrstrøm (2009), Rosenkranz (2012), and Malpass and Wawer (2012). Presentist opponents of future contingent truth, for their part, need to explain how there can be contingent truths about the past but not about the future, given that, on presentism, the past is no more real than the future. (This is not a problem on the growing block theory.) Rhoda (2009) and Zimmerman (2010), for example, have independently suggested that truths about the past could be grounded in God’s present beliefs about the past; but if this move is allowed, it would seem just as legitimate to assume God has present beliefs about the future and use this to ground truths about the contingent future. Todd (2021), for his part, rests his rejection of future contingent truth on an intuition about the future in particular—that there aren’t any facts about the future beyond those produced by the present and the laws—rather than an intuition about truth in general, such as “truth supervenes on being,” a principle which would jeopardize truths about the past as well as truths about the future. A symposium dedicated to Todd’s book includes critiques from Anthony Bigg and Kristie Miller (2025), Mitchell Green (2025), John MacFarlane (2025), and Ryan Wasserman (2025b), along with a response from Todd (2025). The semantic and metaphysical issues surrounding future contingent truth are complex and highly contested, so it isn’t possible to do more than note them here.

It is not clear, however, that the denial of future contingent truth is sufficient to avoid the problem of theological fatalism. David Hunt (2020) suggests that future contingents that fail to be true for presentist reasons alone might nevertheless qualify as “quasi-true” (Sider 1999, Markosian 2004), and argues that the quasi-truth of God’s beliefs about the future is enough to generate the problem. The following consideration tends in the same direction. According to the definition of infallibility used in the basic argument, if God is infallible in all his beliefs, then it is not possible that God believes T and T is false. But there is a natural extension of the definition of infallibility to allow for the case in which T lacks a truth value but will acquire one in the future: If God is infallible in all his beliefs, then it is not possible that God believes T and T is either false or becomes false. If so, and if God believes T, we get an argument for theological fatalism that parallels our basic argument. Premise (4) would need to be modified as follows:

(4′)
Necessarily, if yesterday God believed T, then T will become true.

(6) becomes:

(6′)
It is now-necessary that T will become true.

The modifications in the rest of the argument are straightforward.

It is open to the defender of this solution to maintain that God has no beliefs about the contingent future because he does not infallibly know how it will turn out, and this is compatible with God’s being infallible in everything he does believe. It is also compatible with God’s omniscience if omniscience is the property of knowing the truth value of every proposition that has a truth value. But clearly, this move restricts the range of God’s knowledge, so it has religious disadvantages in addition to its disadvantages in logic.

2.2 God’s knowledge of future contingent truths

If T is true, there is still the question how God could come to believe T rather than not-T, and believe it without any possibility of error, given that T concerns the contingent future. T is contingent only insofar as it is still possible for you to refrain from answering the phone at 9 tomorrow morning, though we’re supposing for the sake of argument that you will answer the phone at 9. But then it’s still possible for T to turn out false (though it won’t), and still possible for the belief that T to be incorrect (though it isn’t). This is hard to square with the claim in premise (1) that God’s belief that T was infallible.

This problem for infallible belief about a contingent future parallels a problem for God’s knowledge of a contingent future. Though the argument for theological fatalism rests only on divine belief rather than knowledge (since the additional conditions for knowledge, beyond true belief, don’t play any role in the argument), God nevertheless wouldn’t believe without knowing. But it’s unclear what could have been cognitively available to God yesterday, when your answering the phone at 9 am tomorrow was still future and contingent, to raise his belief that T from a correct guess to genuine knowledge. Prior (1962) held this to be a further problem for premise (1), beyond the nonexistence of future contingent truths. For William Hasker (1989, 186–88), Richard Swinburne (2006, 22–26), and Peter van Inwagen (2008), who depart from Prior in their endorsement of future contingent truths, the impossibility of foreknowing them is the problem with premise (1). This “limited foreknowledge” view has been critiqued by Arbour (2013) and Todd (2014a), among others, and Hasker (2021) has revised his position in light of Arbour’s criticisms.

Defenders of divine foreknowledge need something to say in response to skeptical questions about how such knowledge could be available to God. One possible response is that it’s a conceptual truth that God is omniscient, and his knowledge, including his knowledge of future contingent truths, is simply innate (Craig 1987). Skeptics might regard this response as closer to a non-response. But others have offered detailed if speculative proposals. These include Ryan Byerly (2014), whose book-length treatment of the issue grounds God’s infallible foreknowledge in a divine “ordering of times” that is supposed to leave human free will intact. Another is Luis de Molina, whose theory of divine “middle knowledge” we’ll turn to in 2.6.

It is relatively easy to see how God can know what is (contingently) “going to” happen if this refers to the present tendency of things. All it takes is exhaustive knowledge of the present. But what is “going to” happen can change, as the present tendency of things changes, and what God foreknows on this basis (his knowledge of what is going to happen) will change along with this change in present tendencies. This “mutable future” position, defended by Peter Geach (1977), has been revived by Todd (2011, 2016b) and critiqued by Wasserman (2025a). On the “Geachian” view, God’s beliefs about the contingent future constitute genuine knowledge, because they track the changing truth about where the future is headed. What this view doesn’t provide is the infallibility required by premise (1).

Fischer (2016, 31–45) endeavors to fill the gap with his “boot-strapping” account of divine foreknowledge. Even human beings are sometimes in a “knowledge-conferring situation,” or KCS, with respect to the contingent future. Since God would be aware of all the evidence and other knowledge-conferring factors that human beings are aware of in such situations, God is in a position to know (some) future contingents in the same way that human beings can know them: by being in the appropriate KCS. But this presupposes a fallibilist theory of knowledge. What accounts for the infallibility of God’s beliefs? Fischer argues that God can “bootstrap” his way to certainty by combining his beliefs about the contingent future with self-knowledge of his own infallibility. Hunt (2017b) objects that the account is circular, and that it couldn’t support anything close to exhaustive foreknowledge, since most future contingent truths relative to a given time will concern events far enough in the future that they will lack KCSs. Fischer (2017, and 2022) elaborates and defends the view.

The most straightforward account of the matter, accommodating the infallibility of God’s beliefs, is that he simply “sees” the future. If God is in time, this requires that he be equipped with something like a “time telescope” that allows him to view what is temporally distant. A hurdle faced by time telescopes is that they probably involve retrocausation. If God is not in time, however, he wouldn’t need a time telescope to view the future along with the present and past. This brings us to the next solution.

2.3 The eternity solution

A third challenge to premise (1), independent of the first two, is that it misrepresents God’s relation to time. What is denied according to this solution is not that T is true, and not that God believes T infallibly, but that God believed T yesterday. This solution probably originated with the 6th century philosopher Boethius, who maintained that God is not in time and has no temporal properties, so God does not have beliefs at a time. It is therefore a mistake to say God had beliefs yesterday, or has beliefs today, or will have beliefs tomorrow. It is also a mistake to say God had a belief on a certain date, such as June 1, 2004. The way Boethius describes God’s cognitive grasp of temporal reality, all temporal events are before the mind of God at once. To say “at once” or “simultaneously” is to use a temporal metaphor, but Boethius is clear that it does not make sense to think of the whole of temporal reality as being before God’s mind in a single temporal present. It is an atemporal present in which God has a single complete grasp of all events in the entire span of time.

Aquinas adopted the Boethian solution as one of his ways out of theological fatalism, using some of the same metaphors as Boethius. One is the circle analogy, in which the way a timeless God is present to each and every moment of time is compared to the way in which the center of a circle is present to each and every point on its circumference (SCG I, 66). In contemporary philosophy an important defense of the Boethian idea that God is timeless was given by Eleonore Stump and Norman Kretzmann (1981), who applied it explicitly to the foreknowledge dilemma (1991). Another notable defenders is Brian Leftow (1991a). More recent defenses may be found in Katherin Rogers (2007a, 2007b), Kevin Timpe (2007), Michael Rota (2010), Joseph Diekemper (2013), and Ciro De Florio and Aldo Frigerio (2015).

Most objections to the timelessness solution to the dilemma of foreknowledge and freedom focus on the idea of timelessness itself, arguing either that it does not make sense or that it is incompatible with other properties of God that are religiously more compelling, such as personhood (e.g., Pike 1970, 121–129; Wolterstorff 1975; Swinburne 1977, 221; Mullins 2016). Zagzebski, while friendlier to the Boethian doctrine of divine timelessness, has argued (1991, chap. 2 and 2011) that the timelessness move does not completely avoid the problem of theological fatalism, since an argument structurally parallel to the basic argument can be formulated for timeless knowledge. If God is not in time, the key issue would not be the necessity of the past, but the necessity of the timeless realm. So the first three steps of the argument would be reformulated as follows:

(1t)
God timelessly knows T.
(2t)
If E is in the timeless realm, then it is now-necessary that E.
(3t)
It is now-necessary that T.

Perhaps it is inappropriate to say that timeless events such as God’s timeless knowing are now-necessary, yet we might have no more reason to think we can do anything about God’s timeless knowing than about God’s past knowing. The timeless realm is as much out of our reach as the past. So the point of (3t) is that we cannot now do anything about the fact that God timelessly knows T. The rest of the steps in the timeless dilemma argument are parallel to the basic argument. Step (5t) says that if there is nothing we can do about a timeless state, there is nothing we can do about what such a state entails. It follows that we cannot do anything about the future.

Since the nature of the timeless realm is elusive, the intuition of the necessity of the timeless realm is probably weaker than the intuition of the necessity of the past, so the availability of a timeless version of the argument for theological fatalism isn’t necessarily fatal to the Boethian solution. The necessity of the past is deeply embedded in our ordinary intuitions about time; there are no ordinary intuitions about the realm of timelessness. One possible way out of this problem is given by Rogers, who argues (2007a, 2007b) that the eternal realm is like the present rather than the past, and so it does not have the necessity we attribute to the past. For a critique of Rogers’ position, see Hasker (2020).

If God’s timeless knowledge doesn’t threaten free will, there’s still the question whether it can be confined to the timeless realm; if not, it might cause trouble for free will even if God exists timelessly. Van Inwagen (2008) argues against the Boethian solution on the grounds that a timeless deity could still bring about the existence in time of a “Freedom-denying Prophetic Object,” for example, a stone slab on which are inscribed the words, “Peter van Inwagen will answer the phone at 9:00 am on May 27, 2034.” An interesting puzzle for Christian defenders of the Boethian solution is the problem of whether the knowledge of Jesus Christ during his time on earth was infallible. The problem here is that the incarnate Christ was in time even if God is not, making Jesus himself a kind of freedom-denying prophetic object (e.g., in his prediction that Peter would deny him three times before morning). A particular problem discussed by Timothy Pawl (2014a, 2014b) is whether Christ had infallible foreknowledge of his own future choices, and if so, whether his created will was free. This problem is manageable on a “kenotic” Christology, according to which Christ “emptied” himself of some of his divine attributes in the Incarnation; but Pawl defends the compatibility of Christ’s infallible foreknowledge and the freedom of his created will without resorting to kenoticism (Pawl 2019, chapters 7–8).

2.4 God’s forebeliefs as “soft facts” about the past

The role of premise (2) in justifying the inference from (1) to (3) has drawn more critical attention than any other move in the argument. The most radical response, discussion of which will be postponed until section 5, is to abandon the Principle of the Necessity of the Past altogether. A less radical response is to clarify the conditions under which the principle holds and argue that (1) does not satisfy these conditions, thereby blocking the move to (3).

This solution, which rejects premise (2) in its full generality, is due to the fourteenth century philosopher William of Ockham, and was revived in the contemporary literature by Marilyn Adams (1967). Following Ockham, Adams argues that premise (2) applies only to the past strictly speaking, or the “hard” past. A “soft” fact about the past is one that is in part about the future. Examples of a soft fact about the past would include the fact that it was true yesterday that George will send his granddaughter a birthday card tomorrow, and the fact that I just visited Paris for the last time. Adams argues that God’s past beliefs about the future are not strictly past. Because they entail facts about the future, they are in part about the future, and consequently count as mere soft facts about the past.

Adams’s argument was unsuccessful since, among other things, her entailment criterion for being a soft fact had the consequence that no fact is a hard fact: that Jack was sitting yesterday should be a hard fact about the past, if anything is, but it entails that Jack won’t sit tomorrow for the first time (Fischer 1989, introduction). This led to a series of attempts to bolster Ockhamist doubts about (2) by giving more refined definitions of a “hard fact” and the type of necessity such facts are said to have—what Ockham called “accidental necessity” (necessity per accidens). The 1980s in particular saw the publication of multiple analyses of the hard-soft fact distinction supportive of the Ockhamist thesis that God’s past beliefs about the future should be regarded as soft facts about the past, including Freddoso (1983), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1984), Kvanvig (1986), Plantinga (1986), Wierenga (1989), and Craig (1990). Critiques of these analyses appeared in Fischer (1983, 1985a, 1991), Hasker (1989), Widerker (1990), Zagzebski (1991), and Pike (1993). One problem hampering the Ockhamist case during this phase of the debate is that the resulting formulations became so refined and elaborate, in an effort to avoid possible counterexamples, that they risked becoming detached from the simple intuition they were intended to capture (Zagzebski 1991, 74–76).

Plantinga (1986) suggests a way this debate could be short-circuited. A successful Ockhamist response to theological fatalism needn’t await the definitive formulation of necessary and sufficient conditions for soft facthood, because paradigm examples of soft facts—facts that are surely soft, if any facts are soft—are enough for the job. It’s clear that proposition T, for example—that you will answer the phone tomorrow at 9 am—does not express a hard fact about the past. (It doesn’t express a fact about the past at all.) But if God is necessarily existent and essentially omniscient, this fact about what you will do tomorrow both entails, and is entailed by, God’s yesterday believing T. Assuming that hard and soft facthood are closed under logical equivalence, it follows that God’s having believed T is not a hard fact about yesterday, a conclusion that doesn’t rely on any particular answer to the general question how the hard fact/soft fact distinction is to be articulated. Responses to this strategy for defending Ockhamism may be found in Brant (1997) and Hunt (2002b).

Since the distinction between hard and soft facts lies at the heart of Ockhamism, the effort to get to the bottom of this distinction, while avoiding the pitfalls of earlier efforts, is ongoing. Finch and Rea (2008) argue that a fact is soft in virtue of depending in the right way on how things go in the future, and since presentists deny that there (now) exists any way that things go in the future, the Ockhamist appeal to soft facts about the past is unavailable to the presentist. Todd, who is a presentist but not an Ockhamist, offers a novel analysis in terms of ontological dependence (Todd 2013), while Garrett Pendergraft and Justin Coates (2014) defend the softness of God’s past beliefs about the future against an important critique from David Widerker (1990). In his defense of Ockhamism, Michael Nelson (2024) distinguishes between the “content” of a divine belief about the future and the attitude God takes towards that content, where the latter is what makes it a belief rather than, e.g., a hope, fear, doubt, or disbelief. He then argues that this content isn’t dependent on the future (every content is in God’s mind, no matter how the future goes), but that God’s having held an attitude of affirmation or denial toward that content is dependent on how the future goes. On this account, God’s propositional attitude is a soft element surrounding the hard “kernel” of the belief’s content, making the forebelief itself a soft fact about the past.

Perhaps the toughest obstacle confronting the Ockhamist solution is that it is very difficult to give an account of the necessity of the past that preserves the intuition that the past has a special kind of necessity in virtue of being past, but which has the consequence that God’s past beliefs do not have that kind of necessity. The problem is that God’s past beliefs seem to be as good a candidate for something that is strictly past as almost anything we can think of, such as an explosion that occurred last week. If God’s past beliefs about the future are soft facts, but the past explosion is a hard fact, that must be because of something special about God’s past beliefs that is intuitively plausible apart from the attempt to avoid theological fatalism. Perhaps God’s doxastic states are best understood in terms of “wide content” or a functionalist account of the mental (Zemach and Widerker 1987); perhaps divine omniscience is dispositional rather than occurrent (Hunt 1995), or doesn’t involve beliefs at all (Alston 1986). If God’s foreknowledge is special in any of these ways, premise (2) is arguably false. But there are theological costs to these conceptions of divine omniscience. Fischer argues that any attempt to evade theological fatalism by appeal to Hilary Putnam’s point that “meanings ain’t in the head” is “implausible” in light of what he calls the “incompatibilist constraint”:

the only way in which God’s belief at t1 about Jones at t2 could be a soft fact about the past relative to t2 would be if one and the same state of the mind of the person who was God at t1 would count as one belief if Jones did X at t2, but a different belief (or not a belief at all) if Jones did not do X at t2 (Fischer 1983: 76).

See also Hasker (1988) for a response to Alston, and Hughes (1997) for a response to Hunt. Since these accounts of divine foreknowledge aren’t independently motivated, however interesting they might be theoretically, it is hard to avoid the conclusion that the Ockhamist solution is ad hoc.

A further question for the “divine exceptionalism” version of the Ockhamist strategy is whether it would truly resolve the problem of theological fatalism, or simply remove God from complicity in the problem. If it’s the latter, the argument can just be reformulated in terms of the kind of infallible foreknower the argument clearly has in its sights, i.e., one whose knowledge is carried by beliefs, whose beliefs are occurrent rather than dispositional, and so on. This is a question for any purported solution, including the Eternity Solution, that appeals to special features of the divine mind. The answer to this question may depend on what exactly the “problem of theological fatalism” is, a question to which we’ll return in section 5.

2.5 The dependence solution

One of the best-known Ockhamist proposals after Adams was made by Alvin Plantinga (1986), who defined the accidentally necessary in terms of lack of counterfactual power. For someone, Jones, to have counterfactual power over God’s past beliefs, the following must be true:

(CPP)
It was within Jones’ power at t2 to do something such that if he did it, God would not have held the belief he in fact held at t1.

Plantinga argued that counterfactual power over God’s past beliefs about human free choices is coherent, and if this power is exercised, these beliefs are not accidentally necessary; they do not have the kind of necessity the past is alleged to have in premise (2) of the basic argument.

Notice that counterfactual power over the past is not the same thing as changing the past. Under the assumption that there is only one timeline, changing the past is incoherent since it amounts to there being one past prior to t2 in which God has a certain belief at t1, and then Jones does something to make a different past. That requires two pasts prior to t2, and that presumably makes no sense. What (CPP) affirms instead is that there is only one actual past, but there would have been a different past if Jones acted differently at t2. (CPP) also does not require the assumption that what Jones does at t2 causes God to have the belief he has at t1. There is much debate about the way to analyze the causal relation, but it is generally thought that causation does not reduce to a counterfactual dependency of an effect on its cause. The dependency of God’s belief on Jones’ act need not be a causal dependency. (CPP) is therefore weaker than the claim that Jones’ act at t2 causes God’s belief at t1. A discussion of the counterfactual dependence of God’s past belief on human future acts is given in Zagzebski (1991, chap 4).

The idea that God’s past beliefs depend upon our future free acts has been enlivened by Trenton Merricks (2009), who argues that the idea appears in Molina (see section 2.6). There is some question how distinct Merricks’ approach is from classic Ockhamism: Fischer and Todd (2011, 2013) argue that Merricks’ solution is simply a form of Ockhamism and suffers from the same defects, while Merricks (2011) replies that the dependency relation between God’s past beliefs and human acts is different from the one at work in Ockham’s approach. The idea, in any case, is that the dependence of God’s foreknowledge of future contingents on the foreknown events themselves, including future exercises of human free will, along with the independence of human actions from God’s foreknowledge of them, is the key to defending the compatibility of divine foreknowledge and human freedom. This “Dependence Solution” has gained sufficient currency that it deserves a section of its own, regardless of its relationship to the original Ockhamist strategy.

The Ur-text for this approach is the following passage in Origen of Alexandria’s Commentary on the Epistle to the Romans:

it will not be because God knows that an event will occur that it happens; but, because something is going to take place it is known by God before it happens.

The because-relationship in question is stronger than counterfactual dependence, because it can be absent even when counterfactual dependence is present, as in the case of divine foreknowledge. (Though you won’t answer the phone tomorrow at 9 am because God foreknew you would do so, your answering it at 9 tomorrow is nevertheless counterfactually dependent on God’s foreknowledge: were God to have believed yesterday that you won’t answer the phone at 9 tomorrow, you wouldn’t answer the phone at 9 tomorrow, and were God to have believed that you will answer at 9, you would answer at 9.) What’s needed is the stronger relationship of explanatory dependence.

Fischer and Tognazzini (2014), in a response to Merricks (2009, 2011), McCall (2011), and Westphal (2011), ask how the dependence point alone shows that the hard past isn’t fixed. That would require that the agent upon whose action the past depends really can act otherwise, and this is just asserted rather than argued. After all, this is the very point at issue, so simply assuming it is to beg the question. Taylor Cyr and Andrew Law (2020) defend the dialectical appropriateness of the assumption that doing and refraining are both open to the agent.

Todd (2013) challenges the courage of dependence theorists’ convictions with a scenario in which, instead of simply foreknowing that you will perform a certain action tomorrow, God prepunished you for it yesterday. The explanatory relations are the same in the two cases, but your undergoing that punishment yesterday is surely a fixed fact about the past, and your performing that action tomorrow is surely unavoidable. We have no less reason to think that God’s foreknowledge belongs to the fixed past and that foreknown actions are unavoidable. Swenson (2016) and Law (2020) dispute the moral Todd draws from his prepunishment case, appealing to time travel scenarios in which some fact about the past depends on what might yet happen in the future, where our intuitions are supposedly more open to the possibility that the past isn’t entirely fixed.

Swenson (2016) argues that what’s fixed isn’t the past in toto, but so much of the past as isn’t dependent on the future. Rather than modifying the principle of the fixity of the past, Law (2020) advocates junking it altogether and replacing it with the principle of the fixity of the independent. Law (2021) continues the case for replacing the fixity of the past with the fixity of the independent by arguing that the former, insofar as the past is fixed, is derivative from the latter. In two papers, Ryan Wasserman stakes out positions that differ from most other defenders of the dependence solution. After reviewing modal, counterfactual, metaphysical, and logical analyses of explanatory dependence, and taking in lessons from time travel cases, Wasserman (2021) concludes that causal dependence is the best model for understanding how God can foreknow what you will do because you will do it, and in Wasserman (2022) he argues that the defense of libertarian freedom against theological fatalism is best served by emphasizing the independence of future actions from God’s foreknowledge rather than the dependence of God’s foreknowledge on the foreknown actions.

The dependence solution redirects attention from the temporal to the explanatory order, in which divine foreknowledge depends on future events while future events do not depend on divine foreknowledge. It then proposes that what’s relevant to assessing libertarian agency is the explanatory order--the temporal order is relevant only insofar as it follows the explanatory order, and (when it does follow it) because it follows it. Thus a fact about the past, such as God’s believing yesterday that T, is irrelevant to the libertarian status of a future action if that fact does not explain, and is instead explained by, that future action. This much is consistent with the past’s being fixed and necessary in just the way that premise (2) requires, and consistent with the solution we’ll look at in 2.7. What the dependence solution adds is that openness in the explanatory order overrides the necessity of the past: any facts about the past that aren’t yet explanatorily fixed, aren’t yet temporally fixed either. So (2) isn’t true in its full generality, and divine foreknowledge is one of the exceptions, blocking the inference to (3).

Whether this additional move is plausible depends on the strength of one’s intuitions about the necessity of the past. These intuitions are at the heart of an exchange between Cyr (2022) and Law (2023). Cyr develops a counterexample to the Dependence Solution in which, owing to a time traveler’s foreknowledge of a future action, the agent intuitively lacks the freedom to do otherwise despite the foreknowledge depending on the action, while Law argues that Cyr’s counterexample conflates epistemic and agential openness and ultimately rests on the question-begging intuition that all past facts are fixed, whether or not they are dependent on the future. It isn’t obvious how the issue between these competing intuitions is to be settled. If the police are already on the way, summoned by the tachyonic alarm system the bank teller is about to activate, does the teller retain the option of not pressing the alarm button? The only scenario in which the teller can access the alternative of not pressing the button seems to be one in which the system malfunctions (e.g., if an electrical short caused the alarm receiver in the police station to sound on its own, without the alarm transmitter in the bank emitting a tachyonic signal X minutes later); but the system by which an infallible deity forms beliefs about the future is immune to malfunction, making it harder to understand how the prior existence of those beliefs is consistent with alternative futures.

Cyr (2018) argues that the Dependence Solution is what does the real work in the Eternity Solution, and if the Dependence Solution succeeds, there is nothing distinctive for divine timelessness to add to this solution. But given the tenacity of belief in the necessity of the past, it may be that the Eternity Solution’s distinctive contribution is to provide the (a)temporal environment in which the Dependence Solution can best operate.

2.6 The transfer of necessity

The next premise in the argument is (5), the principle that licenses the “transfer” of necessity from (3) to (6) via (4). Ockhamists and Dependence Theorists both allow that the necessity of the past, when applicable to past events, transfers to the future. Whether this transfer principle is valid depends on the modality being transferred and the modality effecting the transfer. Logical necessity, for example, is validly transferred by entailment: □p, □(p ⊃ q), ∴ □q. But some modalities, like non-accidentality (Slote 1982), are not closed under entailment. How about the necessity of the past? A much-discussed transfer principle, playing the same role in Peter van Inwagen’s Consequence Argument that (5) plays in the argument for theological fatalism, is rule β (van Inwagen 1983). The necessity-operator featured in this principle is N, where Np is to be read, “p, and no one has, or ever had, any choice about whether p.” Rule β states that, given Np and N(p ⊃ q), it follows that Nq. Counterexamples to rule β were soon discovered, e.g., by McKay and Johnson (1996). But it was easy to amend the Consequence Argument to rest on Np, □(p ⊃ q), ∴ Nq, and this principle appears to have no counterexample. The parallel principle for theological fatalism is □tp, □(p ⊃ q), ∴ □tq, where □tp is to be read, “p is fixed, accidentally necessary, no longer avoidable, etc., relative to time t.” This principle, too, seems to have no counterexample. This doesn’t completely immunize premise (5) from all critique, however. In his essay (2025), Fabio Lampert formulates an intriguing argument for the absurd conclusion that God’s knowledge of contingent a priori truths, no less than God’s knowledge of future contingent truths, entails fatalism. There is something wrong with this argument, Lampert maintains, only if there is something wrong with the argument for theological fatalism, and he suggests that the weakest link is the closure principle to which both arguments appeal.

According to Anthony Kenny (1979, 56–58), Duns Scotus challenged a related closure principle. Fischer (1985b) responds to Scotus’s challenge. But the theory of divine omniscience that has been most closely associated with the denial of (5) is the doctrine of Middle Knowledge. This doctrine was vehemently debated in the 16th century, with the version of Luis de Molina, referred to as “Molinism,” getting the most attention in the contemporary literature. The doctrine has received strong support by Thomas Flint (1998) and Eef Dekker (2000). Unlike the other compatibilist solutions we are considering, which aim only at showing that infallible foreknowledge and human freedom are compatible, Molinism provides an account of how God knows the contingent future, along with a strong doctrine of divine providence. Middle knowledge is called “middle” because it is said to stand between God’s knowledge of necessary truths and his knowledge of his own creative will. The objects of Middle Knowledge are so-called counterfactuals of freedom:

If person S were in circumstances C, S would freely do X.

Middle knowledge requires that there be true counterfactuals of this form corresponding to every possible free creature and every possible circumstance in which that creature can act freely. These propositions are intended to be contingent (a claim that has been disputed by some objectors), but they are prior to God’s creative will. God uses them in deciding what to create. By combining his Middle Knowledge with what he decides to create, God knows the entire history of the world.

There are a number of objections to Middle Knowledge in the contemporary literature. Robert Adams (1991) argues that Molinism is committed to the position that the truth of a counterfactual of freedom is explanatorily prior to God’s decision to create us. But the truth of a counterfactual to the effect that if I were in circumstance C I would do A is strictly inconsistent with my refraining from A in C, and so my refraining from A in C is precluded by something prior in the order of explanation to my act in C. This is inconsistent with my acting freely in C. Climenhaga and Rubio (2022) clarify the nature of explanatory priority and in so doing affirm the essential correctness of Adams’ analysis. There are a number of other objections to Middle Knowledge in the literature, as well as replies by its defenders. William Hasker (1989, 1995, 1997, 2000) has offered a series of objections and replies to William Craig, who defends Middle Knowledge (1994, 1998). Yet other objections have been proposed by Walls (1990) and Gaskin (1993). Additional critical discussions of Molinism may be found in Fischer (2008), Guleserian (2008), Shieber (2009), and Fales (2010). Defenses of Molinism appear in Brüntrup & Schneider (2011) and Kosciuk (2010). Perszyk (2011) is a collection of essays examining Molinism and its future direction, while Perszyk (2013) provides a survey of the literature to that point.

Let us assume, for the sake of argument, that the doctrine of Middle Knowledge is defensible. How does that avoid the conclusion of the argument for theological fatalism? Freddoso (1988, 53–60) argues that Molina rejects the closure of accidental necessity under entailment, but for reasons closer to those inspiring the Dependence Solution (though Molina does not dispute the necessity of the past). Flint (1998) rejects some of the steps of the fatalist argument in addition to defending Middle Knowledge and, more recently, blends of Ockhamism and Molinism have been defended (Kosciuk 2010). The problem for a distinctive Molinist solution to the problem is that Middle Knowledge does not entail the falsehood of any premise of the basic argument (Fischer 2011). A story about how God knows the future might conceivably open up space for a solution to the problem of theological fatalism, but the story provided by the doctrine of Middle Knowledge falls short inasmuch as it replaces one mystery (how God acquires his knowledge of future contingents) with another mystery (how God acquires his knowledge of counterfactuals of freedom). What Molinism needs, according to Justin Mooney (2018), is a more adequate story. In the meantime, while Middle Knowledge offers an intriguing account of divine foreknowledge and providence, it remains neither necessary nor sufficient for avoiding theological fatalism.

2.7 The rejection of the Principle of Alternate Possibilities (PAP)

Compatibilists who hold that it’s possible for an agent to do otherwise, in the sense required for free will, even if her action is causally determined, will probably be untroubled by an argument purporting to show that no one can do otherwise, given divine foreknowledge. The relevant interlocutors for the argument for theological fatalism are those who endorse a libertarian conception of free will (Alston 1985).

With that in mind, let us now look at premise (9). This is a form of the Principle of Alternate Possibilities (PAP), a principle that has become well-known in the literature on free will ever since it was attacked by Harry Frankfurt (1969) in some interesting thought experiments. The point of Frankfurt’s paper was to drive a wedge between responsibility and alternate possibilities, and to thereby drive a wedge between responsibility and libertarian freedom. In general, those defending libertarian freedom also defend PAP, and those attacking PAP, like Frankfurt, defend determinism, but some philosophers have argued that PAP is false even if we have libertarian free will. The literature that clearly distinguishes the claim that free will requires alternate possibilities from the claim that free will requires the falsehood of determinism is contemporary. The former is a thesis about events in counterfactual circumstances, whereas the latter is a thesis about the locus of causal control in the actual circumstances. Aside from the foreknowledge literature, support for the rejection of PAP from the perspective of an incompatibilist about free will and determinism can be found in Stump (1990, 1996), Hunt (1999b), Zagzebski (1991, 2000), Pereboom (2000), and Shabo (2010). This view, originally dubbed hyper-incompatibilism by Fischer, has come to be known as source incompatibilism. For critiques of this version of incompatibilism as solutions to the foreknowledge problem, see Werther (2005) and Talsma (2013).

Here is an example of a typical Frankfurt case intended to show that an agent can act freely even when she lacks alternate possibilities:

Black, an evil neurosurgeon, wishes to see Smith dead but is unwilling to do the deed himself. Knowing that Mary Jones also despises Smith and will have a single good opportunity to kill him, Black inserts a mechanism into Jones’s brain that enables Black to monitor and to control Jones’s neurological activity. If the activity in Jones’s brain suggests that she is on the verge of deciding not to kill Smith when the opportunity arises, Black’s mechanism will intervene and cause Jones to decide to commit the murder. On the other hand, if Jones decides to murder Smith on her own, the mechanism will not intervene. It will merely monitor but will not affect her neurological function. Now suppose that when the occasion arises, Jones decides to kill Smith without any “help” from Black’s mechanism. In the judgment of Frankfurt and most others, Jones is morally responsible for her act. Nonetheless, it appears that she is unable to do otherwise since if she had attempted to do so, she would have been thwarted by Black’s device.

Most commentators on examples like this agree that the agent is both morally responsible for her act and acts freely in whatever sense of freedom they endorse. They differ on whether she can do otherwise at the time of her act. Determinists generally interpret the case as one in which she exercises compatibilist free will and has no alternate possibilities. Most libertarians interpret it as one in which she exercises libertarian free will and has alternate possibilities, contrary to appearances. As mentioned above, some philosophers have interpreted it as a case in which she exercises libertarian free will but does not have alternate possibilities. If Frankfurt cases can be successfully interpreted in this third way, then they can be used to show the compatibility of infallible foreknowledge and libertarian freedom. Hunt (1999a) argues that this is essentially the solution put forward by Augustine in On Free Choice of the Will III.1–4, though Augustine’s own considered position on free will was not libertarian.

Scenarios like the one involving Black, Smith and Jones have been term ‘Frankfurt-Style Counterexamples,’ or FSCs. There is a vast literature on the question whether FSCs succeed in refuting PAP. See the entry on Moral Responsibility and the Principle of Alternative Possibilities

Suppose they do not succeed. An important critique of FSCs is that they contain so-called “flickers of freedom.” One such “flicker” is the alternative of Jones’s exhibiting, rather than not exhibiting, the sign that would trigger Black’s intervention. (Black cannot intervene quickly enough to snuff out the event triggering his intervention.) This is an alternative possibility that’s available in every FSC (Fischer 1994). Another important critique is the “dilemma defense”: the sign for Black not to intervene either causally determines Jones’s decision to murder Smith, in which case Jones lacks alternatives and isn’t morally responsible (on pain of begging the question against libertarians), or it doesn’t causally determine Jones’s decision, in which case Black’s non-intervention leaves Jones free to decide otherwise and he is morally responsible for murdering Smith. Either way, PAP gives just the right result (Widerker 1995b). Considerable debate has arisen over whether the flickers featured in the flicker defense are sufficiently “robust” to satisfy PAP (Fischer 1994, 1999), and whether FSCs can be constructed that avoid the dilemma posed in the dilemma defense (e.g., the “buffer cases” proposed in Hunt 1999b and Pereboom 2000). But if these or any of the other critiques of FSCs that have been proposed are cogent, then PAP stands, and premise (9) is available to justify step (10).

Suppose on the other hand that FSCs do succeed in refuting PAP. Then the argument fails, right? Maybe not. It’s true that premise (9)—PAP in its full generality—would then be false. But defenders of the argument might insist that (10)—the argument’s fatalistic conclusion—is nevertheless warranted, on the grounds that PAP plays such a fundamental role in our moral reasoning that it shouldn’t be abandoned just because it’s possible to concoct a few recherché scenarios in which it delivers the wrong result. FSCs constitute narrow exceptions to PAP, which should continue to be honored except in cases that are structurally just like FSCs (Glatz 2008; Whittle 2016). Divine foreknowledge cases, in particular, are sufficiently different from FSCs that they aren’t entitled to an exemption from PAP.

How similar, or different, are FSCs and cases of infallibly foreknown actions? There are plenty of disanalogies between these two scenarios, but one is enough to illustrate the worry. FSCs rely on counterfactual intervention to eliminate the agent’s alternatives, while difine foreknowledge does not. A crucial component of the standard Frankfurt case is that the agent is prevented from acting freely in close possible worlds. Black’s device is counterfactually manipulative even if it is not actually manipulative. In contrast, infallible foreknowledge is not even counterfactually manipulative. There is no close possible world in which foreknowledge prevents the agent from acting freely. Of course, if theological fatalism is true, nobody ever acts freely, but the point is that there is no manipulation going on in other possible worlds in the foreknowledge scenario. The relation between foreknowledge and human acts is no different in one world than in any other. But it is precisely the fact that the relation between Black’s device and Mary’s act differs in the actual world from what it is in other close worlds that is supposed to make the Frankfurt example work in showing the falsity of PAP (Zagzebski 1991, chap. 6, sec. 2.2).

Both of the foregoing defenses of PAP’s role in the argument can be countered. Start with the second, which grants that FSCs are counterexamples to PAP but denies that status to foreknowledge cases, on the grounds that they aren’t sufficiently analogous. Disanalogies are relevant, however, only if the prospects for exempting divine foreknowledge from PAP depend on how closely it mimics FSCs. That assumption may be unwarranted. Augustine’s counterexample to PAP was divine foreknowledge itself, not a proto-Frankfurtian thought experiment featuring a counterfactual intervener. Since God infallibly believed yesterday that you will answer the phone at 9:00 am tomorrow, there is no alternative possibility in which you fail to answer the phone at 9:00 tomorrow morning; but since “a man does not therefore sin because God foreknew that he would sin” (CG V.10) and, more generally, “God’s foreknowledge does not force the future to happen” (FCW III.4), we can still regard your action as free, even in the libertarian sense. So PAP is false, for the same reasons Frankfurt pronounced it false in his story about Black, Smith and Jones: God’s foreknowledge, no less than Black’s mechanism, “played no role at all” in leading the agent to perform the action, “could have been subtracted from the situation” without making any difference to what happened or why it happened, and is completely “irrelevant” to understanding why the agent acted as she did (Frankfurt 1969, 836–7). Divine foreknowledge constitutes its own counterexample to PAP; it doesn’t need to prove itself by aping FSCs (Hunt 2003).

The first defense of PAP’s role in the argument was that the FSCs are not successful counterexamples to PAP. If so, then far from disqualifying the divine foreknowledge scenario, it’s a point in its favor that it doesn’t work exactly like FSCs. In fact, what make the FSCs vulnerable to the most important critiques that have been offered against them are precisely the respects in which they’re disanalogous to infallible foreknowledge cases. The flicker defense exploits the presence or absence of the sign that would trigger the counterfactual intervener. Whether or not the sign appears is not up to Black—that’s the flicker of freedom that Black cannot extinguish. But God’s foreknowledge doesn’t come online only after a counterfactual trigger; it was always there, leaving no room for any flickers of freedom. The second defense was that FSCs can’t operate as advertised without the covert assumption of causal determinism. Divine foreknowledge, however, eliminates the agent’s alternatives without causally determining them, so it doesn’t jeopardize the agent’s libertarian freedom. That means that divine foreknowledge is not just its own counterexample to PAP, it’s a better counterexample.

If this is correct, the following dilemma critique of theological fatalism becomes available (Hunt 2017a). Either the argument fails somewhere along the way to (8), or it succeeds up through (8). If it fails at one of these earlier steps, it fails full stop. That’s the obvious horn of the dilemma. But if it reaches step (8) successfully, and reaches it for those reasons, we have a case in which you cannot do otherwise than answer the phone tomorrow morning, but you are presumptively free in doing so, since you are acting on your own, and the circumstances that deprive you of alternatives do not in any way explain your action. So (9) is false, and it’s falsified by (8). Whether (1)-(8) succeeds or fails, then, the fatalistic inference to (10) is blocked.

Note that this solution rests on an intuition shared with the dependence response surveyed in 2.5, namely, that God’s foreknowledge is explanatorily dependent on future events, and not the other way around. The difference is that the Dependence Solution retains PAP by denying the general necessity of the past, while the Augustinian/Frankfurtian approach is to abandon PAP and stick with the necessity of the past. It remains to be seen which of these is the better response.

3. Incompatibilist responses to the argument for theological fatalism

Ever since the dilemma of this article was identified, there have been philosophers who thought that something like our basic argument succeeds in demonstrating that infallible foreknowledge is incompatible with human free will. If they are incompatible, one of them must be given up. It’s possible to give up both, of course, but that’s more than the argument requires, and one reason the dilemma has attracted so much attention in the history of philosophy is that both the belief in a being with infallible foreknowledge and belief in the existence of libertarian free will are strongly entrenched in the world view of many philosophers. To give up either of these beliefs is difficult and often has many ramifications for one’s other beliefs.

The denial of libertarian freedom has always had many supporters. The idea of making causal determinism the focal point of discussions of free will is modern in origin, and some philosophers think that the modern framing of the issue is confused. Philosophers who deny libertarian freedom may affirm a type of free will compatible with determinism, or they may instead simply accept the consequence that human beings lack free will. It is worth noting, however, that theists who deny libertarian freedom are typically theological determinists rather than fatalists; it’s primarily considerations of divine omnipotence or sovereignty, rather than foreknowledge, that motivate them. When Augustine, for example, rejected human freedom apart from divine control—“I tried hard to maintain the free decision of the human will, but the grace of God was victorious” (Retractationes 2.1)—it wasn’t because of the fatalist argument from divine foreknowedge, which (as we’ve seen) he regarded as a complete failure. Jonathan Edwards, on the other hand, based his Calvinist denial of libertarian freedom, in part, on a sophisticated version of the argument for theological fatalism (FW II.12).

The other incompatibilist position is to affirm libertarian free will along with the principle of alternate possibilities (premise 9), and to deny the possibility of infallible foreknowledge. This position has come into prominence through its association with “open theism” (Pinnock et al. 1994). Open theists reject divine timelessness and immutability, along with infallible foreknowledge, arguing that not only should foreknowledge be rejected because of its fatalist consequences, but the view of a God who takes risks, and can be surprised and even disappointed at how things turn out, is more faithful to Scripture than the classical notion of an essentially omniscient and foreknowing deity (Sanders 1998, Boyd et al 2001, 13–47). See Rhoda et al (2006) for an argument that the key issue in the open theism debate is the nature of the future, and Tuggy (2007) for an overview of the different positions open theists can take on this question. A reply to both Rhoda et al. and Tuggy may be found in Craig and Hunt (2013). Fischer, Todd and Tognazzini (2009) offers a wide-ranging appraisal of responses to Pike’s argument, paying special attention to open theism and issues in the philosophy of time. For an argument that open theism necessitates the view that propositions about the future lack truth value, see Arbour (2013). Todd disagrees on behalf of the open theist, defending (but without endorsing) the mutability of the future (2016a), and arguing that future contingents are all false rather than truth-valueless (2016b). Boyd (2015) attempts to turn the tables against critics on the grounds that the openist God’s knowledge of all the ways the future might go represents more knowledge than the classical theistic God’s knowledge of the way the future will go. Arbour (2019) is a collection of commisioned essays criticizing open theism on philosophical grounds.

One influential argument that open theists use against defenders of foreknowledge who do not also accept Molinism is that foreknowledge without middle knowledge is useless for divine providence. In a number of papers (1993, 1997, 2009), Hunt has defended the providential utility of foreknowledge without middle knowledge, describing cases in which foreknowledge enhances God’s providential prospects without generating the “metaphysical problem” of explanatory circles, and arguing that the “doxastic problem” of agential impotence when one already knows what one is going to do rests on a principle that is in fact false. Responses to Hunt include Kapitan (1993), Basinger (1993), Robinson (2004a, 2004b), and Hasker (2009). Zimmerman (2012) is friendlier to Hunt’s position.

A related objection to foreknowledge without middle knowledge is that prophecy requires middle knowledge. See Pruss (2007) for a defense of a foreknowledge-only account of prophecy. Another issue related to divine providence is the efficacy of past-directed prayers. Kevin Timpe (2005) argues that adherents of simple foreknowledge or timeless knowledge and Molinists have the resources to explain the efficacy of prayers about the past, but open theism does not.

4. Logical fatalism

A form of fatalism that is even older than theological fatalism is logical fatalism, the thesis that the past truth of a proposition about the future entails fatalism. Aristotle discusses this form of fatalism in his famous Sea Battle Argument, mentioned in section 2.1 above. A clearer and more sophisticated form of the argument was proposed by Diodorus Cronus, whose argument is remarkably similar in form to our basic argument for theological fatalism. The logical fatalist argument parallels our basic argument as follows:

Argument for logical fatalism

Let S = the proposition that there will be a sea battle tomorrow.

(1L)
Yesterday it was true that S. [assumption]
(2L)
If some proposition was true in the past, it is now-necessary that it was true then. [Form of the Necessity of the Past]
(3L)
It is now-necessary that yesterday it was true that S. [1, 2]
(4L)
Necessarily, if yesterday it was true that S, then now it is true that S. [omnitemporality of truth]
(5L)
If it is now-necessary that p and if necessarily (p then q), then it is now-necessary that q. [Transfer of Necessity Principle]
(6L)
Therefore, it is now-necessary that now it is true that S. [3L, 4L, 5L]
(7L)
If it is now-necessary that now it is true that S, no alternative to the truth of S is now-possible. [definition of “necessary”]
(8L)
So no alternative to the truth of S is now-possible [6L, 7L]
(9L)
If no alternative to the truth of a proposition about the future is now-possible, then what the proposition is about will not be brought about by free human choice. [Version of Principle of Alternate Possibilities]
(10L)
Hence, the sea battle tomorrow will not be brought about by free human choice. [8L, 9L]

Unlike the argument for theological fatalism, the argument for logical fatalism has few defenders, with the notable exception of Richard Taylor (1963). One reason is that (2L) is less plausible than (2). (1L) is a soft fact about the past, if anything is. Nevertheless, some philosophers, like Susan Haack (1974) and William Lane Craig (1987), have maintained that theological fatalism is just a gussied up version of logical fatalism, and that the former is no more impressive than the latter once one looks past the theological window-dressing. This seems to be Merricks’ (2009) position as well, since he holds that theological fatalism fails for essentially the same reason as logical fatalism. Warfield (1997) has argued for the equivalence of the two forms of fatalism if God is necessarily existent and essentially omniscient. Responses have been given by Hasker (1998) and Brueckner (2000), and Warfield (2000) offers a rejoinder to both. Hunt (2002b) links Warfield’s argument with Plantinga’s (1986), discussed in 2.4, inasmuch as both exploit the logical equivalence of propositions about the contingent future with God’s believing those propositions, and argues that they both fall prey to the same reductio: the closure principles they invoke (closure of consistency under logical equivalence for Warfield, closure of hard/soft facthood under logical equivalence for Plantinga) would equally support the compatibility of free will with divine determinism, an unacceptable result for a libertarian. Peter Graham (2008) argues that the consensus about consistency to which Warfield appeals emerged against the backdrop of an assumption that there is no necessarily existent being, and is therefore question-begging.

5. Beyond theological fatalism

In the opening paragraph of the paper that spawned the contemporary debate, Pike observed that “the claim that if God is omniscient, no human action is voluntary . . . seems intuitively false. Surely, given only a doctrine describing God’s knowledge, nothing about the voluntary status of human actions will follow” (1965: 27). If Pike’s argument is successful, of course, what seems intuitively false turns out to be surprisingly true. But Pike’s comment suggests that the argument can also be taken aporetically, as generating a puzzle to be solved. Zeno’s Achilles paradox is a classic aporetic problem, because we are well within our epistemic rights in believing that there’s something wrong with the argument without our knowing, or even having any idea, what is wrong with it. Craig maintains that this is just how matters stand when it comes to the problem of theological fatalism:

no matter how ingenious the argument, fatalism must be wrong. For it posits a constraint upon human freedom which is altogether unintelligible. The fatalist admits that our decisions and actions may be causally free—indeed, they could be uttterly uncaused. Nevertheless, such actions are said to be constrained—but by what? Fate? What in the world is that? (1987: 68–69)

The idea that an action otherwise satisfying the most exacting conditions for free agency can turn out to be unfree just because God knew in advance that it would occur seems nearly as absurd as that Achilles can’t pass a tortoise if the tortoise got a head start (Hunt 2017a: 29–31).

Todd (2022), taking issue with Craig, Hunt, and Fischer, in particular, denies that the argument’s conclusion involves a mysterious non-causal constraint on freedom. Since the argument doesn’t posit such a constraint, it’s a mistake to approach it aporetically; instead, the argument successfully demonstrates that something makes the agent unfree, though this something is most plausibly identified with the causal conditions that must have obtained for God to foreknow the action in the first place. This returns us to the question raised in 2.2 about how future contingents could be known, even by God. Replies to Todd may be found in Fischer (2025) and Wasserman (2025c), who argue (among other things) that if “freedom is the freedom to add to the given past” (Carl Ginet 1990: 103), it’s unclear why constraints on freedom must be causal, as Todd maintains.

There’s more at stake in the argument for theological fatalism than the coherence of libertarian theism. A comparison with the Achilles paradox might again be helpful. There’s more at stake in Zeno’s argument than the fleetness of Achilles and the torpidity of tortoises. If that’s all there was to it, the discovery that Achilles was actually a quadraplegic, or that the tortoises of ancient Greece were as fast as jack rabbits, would resolve the puzzle. But that would simply exempt Achilles and/or the tortoise from complicity in the problem; it would do nothing to address the real issues presented by Zeno’s argument. The situation is arguably the same when it comes to the argument for theological fatalism (Hunt 2017a). If the argument gets God wrong by assuming that he’s in time when he isn’t, the problem possibly goes away for God, once the mistake is corrected, but it’s easily reinstated by replacing God with Gud, an infallibly omniscient being who exists in time. If the argument gets human beings wrong by assuming that they have (libertarian) free will when they don’t, the problem can be reformulated in terms of Gud’s infallible beliefs about the future actions of Eleutherians, a race of extraterrestrials stipulated to possess libertarian freedom. This is to understand the argument for theological fatalism as a thought experiment. Whether or not divine foreknowledge and libertarian freedom are real, we’re being asked, what if? Could libertarian freedom really be incompatible with divine foreknowledge for the reasons given in the argument? The answer to this question may involve rethinking more than God and human freedom.

At the heart of the argument is a transfer of temporal necessity from a past event to a future event. It is assumed that there is a kind of necessity that (1) the past has simply because it is past, where (2) this temporal necessity is closed under entailment. Given this necessity, if there is a proposition P that is wholly and strictly about the past, and P entails a proposition Q that is wholly and strictly about the future, then not only is P temporally necessary, but so is Q. But then a proposition that is wholly and strictly about the future will have a necessity that the past has simply because it is past. This might be puzzling even before foreknowledge and free will are brought into the argument.

It may be worth asking whether there is any such thing as the necessity of the past at all. What do we mean when we say that the past, the strict past, is necessary? When people say, “There is no use crying over spilled milk,” they presumably mean that there is nothing anybody can do now about the spilled milk; the spilling of the milk is outside the realm of our causal control. But it is not at all clear that pastness per se puts something outside the realm of our causal control. Rather, it is pastness in conjunction with the metaphysical law that causes must precede their effects. If we decided that effects can precede their causes, it’s quite possible that we would no longer speak of the necessity of the past.

So the necessity of the past may simply be the principle that past events are outside the class of causable events. There is a temporal asymmetry in causability because everything causable is in the future. But some of the future is non-causable as well. Whether or not determinism is true, there are some events in the future that are causally necessary. If a future event E is necessary, it is causable, and not-E is not causable. But if the necessity of the past is the non-causability of the past, it would be odd to pick out the class of propositions about the past as possessing an allegedly distinct kind of necessity since some of the future has that same kind of necessity.

This leads to a deeper problem in the idea of the necessity of the past. Zagzebski (2014) argues that the interpretation of the necessity of the past as a purely temporal modality is confused. What people generally mean by the necessity of the past is that the past is causally closed, meaning the past is neither causable nor preventable. The applicable transfer principle for the fatalist’s argument would then be

Transfer of Unpreventability Principle:

If E occurs and it is not now causable that E does not occur, and necessarily (if E occurs, then F occurs), then it is not now causable that F does not occur.

This principle is virtually identical to the transfer of unpreventability principle proposed by Hugh Rice (2005), and is similar to a strengthened form of van Inwagen’s well-known rule β introduced in 2.6. Here the necessity of the past is not a purely temporal modality, and it is not a form of necessity. The categories of causability and non-causability do not correspond to the standard modal categories of the necessary, possible, and impossible. The attempt to assimilate the causal categories to modal categories is a mistake.

The dilemma of theological fatalism is broader than a problem about free will (Zagzebski 1991, appendix). It’s also broader than a problem about infallible foreknowledge. What foreknowledge contributes to the dilemma is the possibility that every proposition about the future is temporally necessary, because they’re entailed by propositions about God’s past beliefs that are temporally necessary. But the hypothesis of causal determinism has the same consequence: that every proposition about the future is temporally necessary, because they’re entailed by propositions about past states of the universe that are temporally necessary. Whether the entailment is grounded in the postulation of an infallibly omniprescient being or the thesis of causal determinism, if the future in its entirety is temporally necessary, it calls into question some of our most fundamental assumptions about time, for example, that past and future have a different ontological standing, that time has a direction (an “arrow of time”), and so on.

Two books take up the problem of theological fatalism with special attention to issues in the philosophy of time. De Florio and Frigerio (2019) puts the metaphysics of time at the heart of the foreknowledge dilemma and makes essential use of modern tense-logic as developed by A. N. Prior. One solution they develop appeals to “perspectival fragmentalism,” on which reality consists of incompatible but equally real “perspectival facts” that are relative to time, place, or observer. Zagzebski (2024) confirms her skepticism about the necessity of the past, arguing that it is impossible for there to be a type of modality that has the following features:

(a)
The past and future are asymmetrical in that the past qua past is necessary with respect to this type of modality, whereas the future qua future is contingent with respect to this type of modality.
(b)
There are propositions about the past that entail propositions about the future.
(c)
Necessity with respect to this type of modality is closed under entailment.

She concludes that there is no modal arrow of time. The experience of before and after is “non-negotiable,” but it does not require a temporal arrow.

The problem of the alleged incompatibility of infallible foreknowledge and free will is arguably a special case of a more general problem about time and necessity. It may be necessary to achieve some clarity on this latter problem before determining whether God and/or libertarian freedom need to be rethought so that they’re not complicit in the former problem.

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Other Internet Resources

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Linda Zagzebski

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