Judah Halevi

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Ehud Krinis replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Judah Halevi (died 1141) was a Jewish poet, thinker, physician, and public figure. He was one of the exemplary figures of the period known as the “Golden Age of Spanish Jewry.” He lived and worked in the Iberian peninsula during the final decades of the eleventh century and the first decades of the twelfth century. He is considered one of the greatest Hebrew poets of all time (Gil and Fleischer 2001, 17; Scheindlin 2008, 5–6). He is also known as the author of a book whose long title is Book of Refutation and Proof on Behalf of the Despised Religion (Kitāb al-radd waʾl-dalīl fīʾl-dīn al-dhalīl), but which has been known to its readers throughout the generations as The Book of the Kuzari or simply The Kuzari (after the Hebrew namesake of the book’s Khazar king character). In accordance with the conventions of the specific Jewish culture in which he active, Judah Halevi composed this scholarly work in Judeo-Arabic (Arabic written in Hebrew characters, interspersed with citations and words from Jewish tradition in their original languages). The Kuzari is a unique work unlike any other in Jewish thought. In its standard pre-modern Hebrew translation made by Judah ibn Tibbon (d. c. 1190), it became one of the most widespread and influential works in Jewish theology (Shear 2008). Halevi was the premier formulator of Jewish fideism vis-à-vis rationalistic trends in general and the philosophical trend in particular. He distinguishes himself in employing skeptical philosophical measures to support his fideistic attitude (Arieli 1988; Krinis 2020).

• 1. Biography
• 2. The Literary Structure of The Kuzari and its Social Background
• 3. The Identity of the Philosophy and Philosophers Subject to Critique in The Kuzari
• 4. Fideism as the Framework for the Critique of Philosophy in The Kuzari
• 5. Skepticism in the Service of the Critique of Philosophy in The Kuzari
  • 5.1. Disagreement Among Philosophers
  • 5.2 Pointing to Lack of Clarity and to Obscurity
  • 5.3 Equipollence of Counterarguments
    • 5.3.1 Equipollence of Counterarguments on the Issue of the Argument from Design
    • 5.3.2 Equipollence of Counterarguments on the Issue of the Eternity of the World Versus its Creation in Time
    • 5.3.3 Equipollence of Counterarguments on the Issue of Explaining the Process of Giving Forms to Substances
  • 5.4 Casting Doubts on Philosophical Doctrines
    • 5.4.1 Casting Doubts on the Doctrine of the Separate Intellects
    • 5.4.2 Casting Doubt on the Doctrine of the Immateriality and Immortality of the Rational Soul
    • 5.4.3 Casting Doubt on the Doctrine of the Four Elements
• 6. Signs of God’s Presence and the Ways to Perceive Them
  • 6.1 The Inadequacy of Philosophical Epistemology in Perceiving the Signs of God’s Presence
  • 6.2 The Ways that Lead to Perceiving the Signs of God’s Presence
    • 6.2.1 Apprehending the Signs of God’s Presence Through the Senses and Tradition
    • 6.2.2 Perceiving the Signs of God’s Presence Through the Internal Senses and Mystical Experience
• Bibliography
  • Primary Works
  • Secondary Sources
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Biography

Only a few details are known about most of Judah Halevi’s life. His birth year is unknown. Circumstantial evidence suggests that he was born during the eighth decade or the first half of the ninth decade of the eleventh century (Scheindlin 2008, 15, 254) . His birthplace was likely the city of Tudela in the northwest of the Iberian peninsula. Various hints embedded in the poems of Jewish poets of the period suggest he grew up in the northern, Christian regions of the Iberian peninsula (Schirmann 1979, 251–253).

While still in his youth, Halevi’s reputation as a poet of exceptional talent was already established. He continued to write poetry throughout his life and was a prolific poet. Although, due to his upbringing in the Christian north, he was initially considered an outsider in the Jewish Andalusian social elite, his early talent as a poet earned him an entry ticket to the circles of this elite (Brann 2000b, 268–269). Members of this Jewish-Andalusian elite adopted the values and curriculum of the dominant Islamicate elite culture of their time; some even served in various positions in centers of power and government in the Christian and Muslim kingdoms of the Iberian peninsula.

While he was living in the town of Lucena, Judah Halevi acquired knowledge of Jewish law from the great Jewish-Andalusian rabbis of his generation. Despite his rabbinic education and the title “Rabbi” which was attributed to him, he did not function as a Rabbi in any Jewish community. His primary livelihood came from his work as a physician. Among other places, he worked in this profession in the city of Toledo, during the period when control of this central city passed into Christian hands. In a later period of his life, Halevi lived for years in the city of Córdoba, another central city in the Iberian peninsula, which was still under Muslim rule when Halevi lived there (Yahalom 2009, 51–80).

The last years of Halevi’s life were his most prolific and significant. In these years, he wrote many of his famous “Zion poems,” as well as The Kuzari. Finally, he also succeeded in realizing his aspiration to reach the Land of Israel and die there.

Our knowledge of this late period is much richer than our knowledge of the preceding periods of Halevi’s life. The main source of this knowledge is surviving letters that have reached us from fragments of documents, books, and papers that were piled up for centuries in a room of a synagogue in old Cairo. Following the transfer of this written material to libraries in Western countries, it became known as the “Cairo Geniza.”

The relevant letters from the Cairo Geniza are being gradually uncovered and deciphered by various scholars. They are all connected to the Jewish-Egyptian merchant Halfon ben Nethanel, who became acquainted with Halevi in the last years of his life. They include information about Halevi’s connections with his circle of acquaintances and some of his public and economic activities. These letters also contain extensive information about Halevi’s journey from the Iberian peninsula to the Land of Israel. This journey included a stopover in Egypt, where he stayed for about eight months (early September 1140 to mid-May 1141). During this stay, Judah Halevi was hosted by key figures in the Jewish communities of Alexandria and Cairo. In May 1141, Halevi sailed from the port of Alexandria on his way to the Land of Israel. The Cairo Geniza letters discovered and deciphered so far do not include specific information about his fate in the Land of Israel, but it can be inferred from them that he died there in the summer of 1141, about two months after his departure from Alexandria (Scheindlin 2008, 97–152).

The most recent scholarly synthesis of the relevant Cairo Geniza findings presented by M. A. Friedman, and based on additional letters that were not accessible previously, paints a different picture from the one accepted by earlier scholars. According to the earlier scholars most prominently S. D. Goitein, M. Gil and E. Fleisher), the writing of The Kuzari took many years, during which the book underwent several changes and edits (Goitein 1988. Gil and Fleisher 2001, 182–184). In contrast, according to the picture emerging from the more up-to-date research, Halevi carried out the writing of The Kuzari in a much shorter period, in the few years that preceded his departure for his journey to the Land of Israel in 1140. This conclusion is based on a new dating of the Cairo Geniza letters that refer to the initial acquaintance between Halevi and Halfon ben Nethanel, including a letter in which Halevi refers briefly and enigmatically to the circumstances of The Kuzari’s writing. Recent studies have deduced that these letters were written during a visit by Halfon to the Iberian peninsula that took place in 1138–1139. This dating of the time of Halevi and Halfon ben Netanel’s initial acquaintance is considerably later than the dates attributed to it in previous studies (Friedman 2013, 226–253; Friedman 2016; Lasker 2024).

2. The Literary Structure of The Kuzari and its Social Background

The opening remarks of The Kuzari indicate that it belongs to the genre of polemical literature. It includes a polemic directed at philosophers, an inter-religious polemic directed at Christians and Muslims, and an intra-Jewish polemic directed at the Karaites as a minority group among the Jews.

From a literary standpoint, the prominent features of The Kuzari are its dialogue and frame story components (Schweid 1970, 38–44; Silman 1995, 331–338 Hughes, 2007, 481–489; Ravitsky 2019, 554–558). The dialogues in the book are related to its frame story. The dialogues occupy the lion’s share of the book’s five treatises, while segments of the frame story are integrated into the opening of the first treatise, the opening of the second treatise, and the end of the fifth and last treatise. The book’s plot takes place in the court of an anonymous king, identified as the ruler of the Khazar kingdom. The time of the plot is four hundred years before Halevi wrote The Kuzari, that is in the year 4500 of the Jewish calendar, which corresponds to parts of the years 739–740 of the Christian calendar (1:1, 1:47).

At the center of the plot is a repeated dream of the Khazar king. The message in the dream, conveyed by an angelic figure, undermines the Khazar king’s confidence in his specific religion. Subsequently, the Khazar king summons several sages to his court, to discuss their doctrines with him. In the first stage, the invitees are a philosopher and two sages representing the Christian and Islamic religions. In the second stage, after the discussions with these three sages have not satisfied him, the Khazar king also invites another representative called Ḥabr (Heb. Ḥaver) which is an Arabic appellation of a Jewish sage. The dialogues between the Khazar king and the philosopher and between the king and the sages of Christianity and Islam are brief and occupy a relatively small part of the book’s first treatise (1:1–9). In contradistinction, the dialogue between the Khazar king and the Jewish sage is long and detailed. It spans most of the remainder of the book and spreads over its five treatises.

Despite the general similarity of The Kuzari to other works in the dialogical genre of its period, some of its features are exceptional. One important difference is that the dialogue that takes place between the Khazar king and the Jewish sage throughout most of the book does not conform to the common imbalance between the two speakers, where one serves as the guide and the other as the guided. The Jewish sage is indeed the dominant figure and enjoys an advantage over his interlocutor, the king. Nevertheless, occasionally the king often proves to be a valuable interlocutor. In few places throughout the dialogue, he even functions as an equal (5:7–8), and sometimes even points out weaknesses in the Jewish sage’s arguments (1:114; 2:23; 4:26).

Another related difference that distinguishes The Kuzari’s dialogue from the conventional dialogical pattern is that in works of that kind, the aim of the dialogical form is that the participant in the dialogue who does not share the author’s denomination will recognize the superiority and pre-eminence of the arguments presented by the speaker representing the author’s denomination. This recognition may culminate in the interlocutor’s conversion to his speaker’s denomination and joining his group. In contrast, The Kuzari’s narrative concludes long after the Khazar king’s conversion to Judaism, with the Jewish sage’s decision to leave the king’s court and travel to the Land of Israel. The Khazar king objects to his interlocutor’s plan and argues strongly against the claims the latter raises to justify it. Against this backdrop, the two debaters separate as friends, to be sure, but not as those who have reached an agreement (5:22–28).

Ostensibly, the frame story that Halevi has crafted is based, as he admits in the opening, on known facts from historical sources. According to these sources, in a period preceding the writing of The Kuzari by several centuries, the people of the Khazar kingdom, all or some of them, converted to Judaism following an inter-religious encounter in which their king debated with the religious sages of Christianity, Islam, and Judaism (Golden, 2007; Wasserstein, 2007).

Yet Halevi allows himself to deviate from the narratives appearing in these sources, in ways that indicate that his connection to them is a free and non-binding connection (Levinger 1971, 476–480). The prominent expression of this deviation by Halevi is the way he sets not the Judaization of the Khazar king and his people, but rather the journey to the Land of Israel, as the final goal to which his book’s frame story aspires. Another notable deviation is the inclusion of the figure of the philosopher in the dialogues conducted by the Khazar king. In the previous Jewish and Muslim sources of the story of the conversion of the Khazars and their king, there is no mention of the figure of the philosopher, whereas in Halevi’s book, he appears as the first of the speakers summoned by the Khazar king to debate with him in his court.

The notable deviations of The Kuzari’s author from the narrative of the Judaization of the Khazar king and his subjects, as it was known to contemporary readers, can be understood in light of aspects in Halevi’s own life that motivated him to compose his book. As mentioned above, The Kuzari was written close to the time of Halevi’s departure for his journey to the Land of Israel. The preparations that the author made for this journey at that time were known to the people in his circle within the Jewish-Andalusian elite. It is against this backdrop that the details of The Kuzari’s frame story acquire their full meaning as a cover story as I shall explain below.

The development of the book’s plot in the court of the Khazar king alludes to the courtly environment in which the culture of the Jewish-Andalusian elite of the period developed and flourished. The services that the members of this elite provided in the courts of rulers, powerful men, and wealthy patrons of science and culture (some of whom were also Jews), in the Muslim and Christian cities and kingdoms, brought them into direct contact with the human, religious and intellectually diverse world of the courtly culture in the Iberian peninsula (Brann 2000a). From Halevi’s perspective, as one who knew the Jewish-Andalusian elite from within, the participation and close contacts of the Jewish elite in the cultural world of foreign rulers’ courts were perceived as a serious threat to the identity and stability of the Jewish communities scattered in exile. Thus, as a cover story, the main point of The Kuzari’s frame story is to points to the danger that the exile of the people of Israel poses to its existence. This danger is especially acute in the specific manifestation of this exile in the inter-religious and multi-directional encounter and assimilation of the Jewish-Andalusian elite with the courtly culture of their time and place (Berger, 1992).

Throughout the book, views uttered by Khazar king tend to resemble views typical of those of the educated members of the Jewish-Andalusian elite. The individuals that the king first summons to his court—the philosopher, the Christian sage, and the Muslim sage — are prototypes of individuals whom the members of the Jewish-Andalusian elite encountered as part of their activities in the courts of the wealthy and powerful rulers and patrons. The polemical tone of The Kuzari is revealed to be primarily directed at the views and values of this elite. The danger posed by the daily rubbing shoulders of the Jewish elite with the corresponding Christian and Muslim elites in the courts of the Andalusian power brokers is expressed in the counterarguments of the Jewish sage against the claims of the representatives of these religions. Furthermore, the unusual inclusion of the figure of the philosopher at the beginning of the frame story, the extensive treatment of the philosophers and their views by the Khazar king and his Jewish interlocutor, and the polemic against these views throughout the book, all testify to the great interest and special attraction that the Jewish-Andalusian elite showed toward philosophy (Cohen 1967, 295–302).

Finally, the Jewish sage’s departure from the Khazar king’s court on his way to the Land of Israel, at the end of the book (5:22–28) corresponds to Halevi’s own decision to dedicate the rest of his life to the realization of a vision of self and national redemption. The fact that Halevi’s peers in the Jewish-Andalusian elite rejected this voyage and its justifications, and declined to join it, is reflected in some of Halevi’s late poems (Alfonso 2008, 78–82), as well as in the counterarguments he places in the mouth of the Khazar king (5:22; 5:24; 5:26).

3. The Identity of the Philosophy and Philosophers Subject to Critique in The Kuzari

Halevi placed the plot of The Kuzari four hundred years before the time of his composition of the work. Hence, the book’s plot takes place in a period that followed the emergence and rise of Islam but by large precedes the emergence of philosophy written by philosophers of the Islamicate cultural world. Accordingly, The Kuzari, as a work written in Judeo-Arabic, lacks any explicit reference to philosophical literature written in Arabic, whether by Muslim authors or by Christian and Jewish authors. With the curious exception of the astronomer al-Battānī (4:29), none of the writers of the Islamicate period are mentioned in the book.

Throughout The Kuzari, philosophy is considered the legacy of ancient Greek culture. The names of philosophers and philosophical schools mentioned in it are always those of figures and schools from the Greek and Hellenistic periods (1:1; 4:25; 5:14). The same is true for the few philosophical books explicitly mentioned (4:25; 5:8).

Nevertheless, signs emerge between the lines that testify to the close connection of the book and its author to the world of philosophy of his time. For example, Aristotle is referred to simply as ‘the philosopher’ (1:73) – the status accorded to him within the culture of the Muslim period. Furthermore, in one place in the book, the Jewish sage distinguishes between “the philosophers of Greece,” who had no acquaintance with the prophets and their miracles, and “those who philosophize among the followers of the religions,” whose doctrines are already marked by this acquaintance (4:3 in comparison with 1:63; 1:65). These statements express the author’s understanding that the encounter and tension between philosophy and revealed religions belongs to the post-Greek period. Thus, it was clear to him that the challenge posed by philosophy to these religions, and to the religion of Israel in particular, is a matter whose relevance concerns precisely the development of philosophy in periods later than the period of classical Greek philosophy.

It is not surprising, therefore, that contrary to the impression Halevi attempts to create, according to which the philosophy with which he contends and polemicizes is Greek philosophy, an examination of the philosophical doctrines presented in The Kuzari reveals that in most cases, their formulations are based on the legacy of philosophers of his own period and culture. Although the connection of these philosophers to the Greek and Hellenistic philosophical legacies was strong, those prominent among them, such as al-Farabi (d. 950 or 951) and Ibn Sina (d. 1037), were original philosophers who added their own contributions to the classical legacy on which they relied.

In the presentation of the anonymous philosopher to the Khazar king on the core positions of the philosophers (1:1), only the names of Greek philosophers are mentioned. Nevertheless, the examination of the philosophers’ doctrines presented in this section as well as other sections in the book, reveals that they are based on the doctrines of the great Arab philosophers of the period—al-Farabi, Ibn Sina, and Ibn Bajja (d. 1139)—as well as the formulations of the great theologian al-Ghazali (d. 1111), which highlight the tension between the doctrines of al-Farabi and Ibn Sina and the core principles of the revealed religions (Kaufmann 1877, 119–140; Baneth 1941–2 [1981]; Kogan 2002). The theory of the Separate Intellects and the special functions reserved in it to the Active Intellect (the lowest among those Intellects), that the Jewish sage attributes to Aristotle in one place (4:25). is a theory developed by al-Farabi and adopted with modifications Ibn Sina and Ibn Bajja (Davidson 1972, 352–381; Davidson, 1992, 181–195; Pines 1980, 210–217). The philosophical theory of prophecy that the Jewish sage sharply polemicizes against (1:87) is a doctrine of al-Farabi (Lobel 2000, 140–141; Krinis 2013, 5). The philosophical theory of the soul that the Jewish sage presents in detail (5:12) is a doctrine of Ibn Sina. This case is especially illuminating, as the presentation of this subject that Halevi puts in the mouth of the Jewish sage in this case is an abridged paraphrase of a treatise by Ibn Sina (Landauer, 1872, 335–336).

We learn that just as The Kuzari’s frame story is primarily a cover story, in which the events in the Khazar king’s court in the eighth century serve as a literary disguise for Halevi’s engagement with and reaction to the courtly culture of his time, so too his reference to philosophy as an ancient Greek legacy is a disguise for his engagement and reaction to the philosophy of his own time.

4. Fideism as the Framework for the Critique of Philosophy in The Kuzari

Rhetorically, the Jewish sage’s and the Khazar king’s statements about the philosophers throughout the dialogues of The Kuzari are marked by a lack of uniformity. On the one hand, they use harsh expressions of condemnation. For example, the Khazar king points out that Aristotle and his followers advocate a position that attributes wisdom and an active capacity for action to nature. In doing so, he believes, they are guilty of the grave sin, from a religious standpoint, of association, i.e., attributing to a created force capabilities belonging only to God (1:76). Similarly, in the opinion of the Jewish sage, one who follows the philosophical cosmological theory, according to which God’s influence on the existing world is mediated by a hierarchy of intermediate entities, should be considered a heretic (5:21).

On the other hand, the Jewish sage shows appreciation for the philosophers by admitting that among those who use methods of rational inference, they are the most meticulous and serious (4:3; 4:15). Therefore, their achievements in what is accessible to rational inquiry are the most impressive (1:99).

This lack of uniformity in rhetorical expressions toward the philosophers is largely explained by understanding that Halevi’s general approach to philosophy is consistent with a position that in the modern period is referred to as fideism. Generally speaking, a fideistic approach is one that emphasizes the independence and autonomy of religious faith from reason (Amesbury, 2022). Furthermore, rational inquiry is perceived within the fideistic conception as unsuitable as a basis for religious faith. Halevi’s fideism is based not on an extreme anti-rationalist position that denies any value to rational inquiry, but on a moderate and selective fideistic position. According to him, philosophical rational inquiry does yield valid results in certain fields, but these fields are not the ones with important religious-theological implications.

In the programmatic formulation of this position, the Jewish sage points to the difference between the realms of “human wisdom” and “divine wisdom” (Halper 2021, 69–77). “Human wisdom” is the realm that includes the theory of logic and the mathematical sciences, fields in which the philosophers, as those most dedicated to rational inquiry, have achieved undeniable accomplishments. However, in the higher sciences, those of physics and metaphysics, the philosophers have failed to achieve similar decisive results. This failure, says the Jewish sage, is unavoidable, since those lacking the divine light of prophecy, like philosophers, lack the ability to establish certain conclusions in the sciences that relate to the realm of “divine wisdom” (5:14).

Halevi’s moderate and selective fideism is further expressed in the issue of providing rationalistic explanations for the religious commandments. On this matter, he distinguishes between “rational and governmental commandments” and “divine auditory commandments.” According to the Jewish sage, the “rational commandments,” those that can be explicated by means of reason, were included in the Torah of Israel because they are binding rules for any human society. In contrast, the epistemological status of the “divine commandments,” such as the ones related to the Temple’s sacrifices, Sabbath and circumcision, commandments which are unique to the people of Israel, is neutral. Reason neither approves nor disapproves them (2:48). Therefore, any rational explanations we can offer to clarify them cannot be considered satisfactory and decisive explanations (2:26; 2:60).

The irrelevance of philosophy to religion is affirmed already by the Khazar king in the dialogue between him and the philosopher at the beginning of the first treatise. A prominent place in the philosopher’s opening presentation is reserved for the characterization of the godhead as a static and impersonal entity, whose relationship with the world is a necessary and indirect one. The God of the philosopher lacks will, knowledge of particulars, interest in human beings and reaction to their prayers and actions. The service of God is a necessary condition for attaining human perfection. Yet it is not related to God Himself and does not express His will. Consequently, it follows that, from the philosophical point of view, the varying practices of the service of God within the different religions are of equal value (1:1).

In his reaction to this presentation, the Khazar king emphasizes that although he judges the philosopher’s characterization of the godhead and his estimation of religion to be convincing, it is irrelevant to him. The Khazar king received a directive from above in his dream to seek the desirable action in the service of God. He considered this internal occurrence as a kind of prophetic message directed at him. He is therefore obliged to seek the correct, exclusive path in the service of God. From the philosopher’s description he has learned that philosophy has nothing to contribute to his search (1:2). The Khazar king’s response reveals a fideistic basic position, that the philosophical theory of the godhead and religion is insufficient to support and sustain a binding and exclusive religious practice for the worshippers.

The irrelevance of the philosopher for the Khazar king is not only a matter of the doctrines and practices he has presented to him. In the concluding section of the dialogue between them, the king also points to the apparent evidence that prophecy and miraculous happenings associated with it are not to be found among philosophers, while appearing among people who have not undergone philosophical training and have not acquired its sciences (1:4). This historical evidence supplements the conclusion reached by the Khazar king earlier, that for him, as one who is seeking a path originating in a semi-prophetic revelation, philosophy and its doctrines are irrelevant.

5. Skepticism in the Service of the Critique of Philosophy in The Kuzari

The philosophy laid down by the philosopher in the opening section of The Kuzari represents a dogmatic approach, formulating his claims as conclusive ones. Most philosophical schools that arose in the ancient Greek and Hellenistic cultures were dogmatic. Alongside them, schools with a skeptical orientation also appeared and developed (Vogt, 2022). The proponents of these schools held the view that philosophical discussion is a constant search that cannot be exhausted: true philosophical discourse is characterized by its open ongoing deliberations that avoid decisive conclusions. Loyal to this approach, a skeptical philosopher always refrains from jumping to conclusions. He questions the conclusions reached by representatives of the dogmatic philosophical schools, but without attempting to replace them with decisive conclusions of his own.

Halevi’s critique of philosophy in The Kuzari is based on a fideistic assumption, not on a skeptical one. Classical skepticism rejects dogmatic positions across the board, while Halevi advocates certain dogmatic positions which he considers the absolute truths of the religion of Israel. In the spirit of the fideistic approach, he argues that these truths do not need the measures of rational inquiry for their justification.

The general culture in which Halevi operated was the classical Islamicate culture, in which Jews like him took part alongside members of other religions, primarily Muslims and Christians. The adherents of these religions advocated the absolute truths of their faiths. Similarly, the philosophical currents that appeared in this culture were dogmatic in their tendency. Turning to skeptical philosophy and using its measures were far from common. Against this background, The Kuzari stands out as a work that utilizes a variety of skeptical measures within a fideistic framework. Thus, Halevi’s use of these measures is an instrumental one. He did not seek to establish skepticism as an alternative philosophy to the dominant dogmatic philosophy of his time. Instead, by using skeptical measures he strives to show that the presumption of dogmatic philosophy to establish, by means of rational inquiry, truths that are equivalent to truths of religion is baseless.

In the spirit of classical skepticism, Halevi points out in various places throughout The Kuzari that following the path of rational inquiry cannot lead to the establishment of truths relevant for one who believes in the Torah of Israel and accepts the yoke of its commandments. In the spirit of the fideistic approach he adheres to, he points out that the certainty granted to the truths of the Jewish religion is granted to them through ways that are not the ways of philosophy (see the discussion below).

Halevi had no direct acquaintance with the literature of the skeptical schools of the ancient Hellenistic world. The works of authors from these schools were not translated into Arabic, unlike the works of some representatives of the other Greek and Hellenistic philosophical schools, primarily works by Aristotle and his commentators. The many works translated into Arabic of the illustrations Hellenistic physician Galen (d. c. 200), served probably, as a main source for Halevi’s exposure to skeptical arguments (Krinis 2020, 15, 67–69, 94). The indirect and fragmented acquaintance of authors in the classical Islamicate culture with the Greek-Hellenistic skeptical legacy is reflected in the sporadic, partial, and unsystematic use that Halevi makes of measures originating from this legacy. Nevertheless, the application he makes of several skeptical measures is of great interest. In this application, Halevi found a way to polemicize against philosophy, not only by means taken from non-philosophical traditions, but also by those taken from the inventory of the philosophical tradition itself.

Moreover, the combination of moderate, selective fideism and the variety of skeptical measures specified below is what allows Halevi to bring supporting evidence for the claim that there is no contradiction between the doctrines and commandments of the Torah of Israel and human reason (1:67; 1:89). The absence of such contradiction is a consequence of the fact that the fields in which the use of the measures of rational inference leads to valid and certain conclusions are irrelevant to the religion of Israel. In contrast, to the extent that the philosophers’ use of rational measures in other fields, such as physics and metaphysics, leads to conclusions that contradict the doctrines and commandments unique to the Torah of Israel, these conclusions turn out to be uncertain and doubtful. Thus, the status of those doctrines and commandments, as ones that are neither contrary to reason nor confirmed by reason, remains intact (2:48; 3:23; 3:53).

5.1. Disagreement Among Philosophers

Disagreement (G. diaphōnia; A. lā ittifāq bayna; lan muttfiqīn) is one of the basic measures of the ancient skeptics in their confrontation with the representatives of the dogmatic philosophical schools of their period. For skeptics, the inability of dogmatic philosophers to reach agreement among themselves on almost any issue under discussion, while applying the measures of rational argumentation, is highly suggestive. It testifies against the fundamental dogmatic position that the application of these measures leads to a proven and decisive conclusion on the issues under discussion.

In Halevi’s hands, the claim regarding disagreement among philosophers serves as a criterion by which one can draw a boundary line that distinguishes between the fields in which the philosophers’ use of the measures of rational inquiry leads to valid conclusions, and the fields in which the use of these measures falls short of establishing such valid conclusions.

According to Halevi’s Jewish sage in The Kuzari, the agreement prevailing among philosophers in the fields of mathematical sciences and logic indicates the validity of the use of philosophical measures of inquiry in these fields. In contrast, the disagreements prevailing among philosophers on issues of the science of physics, and even more so on issues of the science of metaphysics, indicate the inability of philosophical measures to establish valid conclusions in the domains of these sciences (5:14). This particular use that Halevi makes of the measures of disagreement among philosophers complies with his fideistic approach. By raising it he seeks to limit the applicability of philosophical methods to sciences that are inconsequential to theology and religion in terms of the knowledge drives from them.

Another application of the skeptical measure of disagreement among philosophers concerns what the Jewish sage calls the “the syllogistic, governmental religion.” In the context of the discussion on this issue (1:12–13), this refers to the sum of actions and beliefs necessary for the establishment of a philosophical-political constitution with religious characteristics. The complete failure, according to the Jewish sage, of the philosophers to reach agreement among themselves regarding any detail of these actions and beliefs is a highly significant failure. It shows that the philosophers’ claim, expressed in the exchange between the philosopher and the Khazar king (1:1–3) – to establish a constitution based on reason, called “the religion of the philosophers,” as an alternative to the revealed religions—is a failed and false enterprise.

5.2 Pointing to Lack of Clarity and to Obscurity

The assertion that certain discussion is lacking clarity (G. adēlos; A. aghmāẓ, yaghmuẓu) recurs very frequently in ancient skeptic literature. Since the rule held by the skeptic philosopher is that he does not assent on unclear issues, his pointing out that a particular issue is lacking clarity allows him to refrain from assent on any conclusion regarding it.

Halevi employs this skeptical tactic in several places in The Kuzari. In the Jewish sage’s concluding discussion on the issue of justifying God’s ways (theodicy)—the issue of the reasons for “a righteous person suffering misfortune and a wicked person enjoying good fortune”—he states that it is too deep and obscure to be clarified. Accordingly, it is doubtful whether inquiry into it can lead to the discovery of its causes (5:21— reading here with the Oxford-Bodleian Pococke 284 manuscript, rejecting Baneth and Ben-Shammai amendment in their critical edition, 225, n. 18). On the issue of the eternity of the world or its creation in time, the Jewish sage states that it is deep and obscure. This statement serves as a preliminary step to reaching the conclusion that rational inquiry cannot lead to a conclusion on the matter (1:67).

The claim that an issue is obscure and deep also allows the Jewish sage to refrain from deciding on the issue of anthropomorphism, as it arises from the descriptions of God as one who directly created material objects such as the Tablets of the Covenant. In the discussion that develops between the Khazar king and the Jewish sage on this issue (1:88–91), the sage initially presents an explanation consistent with the accepted position in the philosophy and the rationalistic theology of the period (1:89). According to this dogmatic position, adherence to the principle of denying God’s corporality requires us to firmly deny the possibility of such a direct creation. However, in his concluding remarks, the Jewish sage insists that considering the depth and obscurity of the issue under discussion, the explanation he previously presented to the Khazar king should not be considered final and decisive. His concluding claim in this discussion is that the way of creating material objects like the Tablets of the Covenant could be clear for the ones who were direct witnesses to such act of creation. Contrawise, its clarification by means of rational inquiry, the method adopted by the philosophers, cannot free us from doubts (1:91).

5.3 Equipollence of Counterarguments

Pointing to the “equipollence or equivalence of counterarguments” (G. isostheneia; A. dalāʾil al-ḥujjatayin mutakāfiʾa is one of the distinct measures of the skeptic discussion, in which the skeptic philosopher presents counterarguments to the arguments of the dogmatic philosopher. He is using this measure not to refute the dogmatist’s position on the issue under discussion, but to indicate a state in which the arguments in favor of the different positions balance each other in a way that prevents a decision between them. In skeptic philosophy, the conclusion resulting from reaching a state of equipollence of counterarguments is the “suspension of judgment” (epochē).

For Halevi, whose recourse to skeptical measures is derived from a fideistic point of view, supplementing the measure of equipollence of counterarguments with the additional skeptical measure of the suspending judgment is unnecessary. From his perspective, a rational-philosophical discussion on a certain theological issue that has reached a stalemate can be resolved by resorting to ways other than the rational-philosophical ones.

5.3.1 Equipollence of Counterarguments on the Issue of the Argument from Design

In the opening part of the dialogue between the Jewish sage and the Khazar king (1:11–25), the equipollence of counterarguments appears only implicitly, disguised by an allegory. Moreover, the theological issue under discussion is also disguised by means of that same allegory. The starting point here is the question formulated by the Jewish sage: does what is revealed about the justice and good qualities in the conduct of the people of India necessitate honoring and praising the name of their ruler (1:19)? Behind this statement about the “ruler of India” and the just order revealed in the conduct of his subjects stands a theological issue that the Khazar king and the Jewish sage touched upon briefly earlier in their exchange. This exchange revolved around the idea of religion based on rational inquiry as a religion relying, among other things, on the proof that God fashioned the world and governs it (1:12–13). From this context, it can be understood that the allegory of the ruler of India and the question asked about him are directed at the rational proof known as the “Argument from Design.” According to this argument, the order and regularities prevailing in the world are proof of God’s existence and His active role as the originator of this order.

In the discussion on the allegory that the Jewish sage presents about the ruler of India and his subjects, the Argument from Design is questioned. The Khazar king, for his part, does not deviate from the realm of the allegory and chooses not to respond to the Jewish sage’s question by means of a decision—i.e., with a positive or negative answer. Rather, he hints that this is an issue for which several alternative answers exist, and one cannot determine which of them is the right one: the good and just order prevailing among the people of India may originate in themselves; it may originate in their ruler; and it may originate in both them and their ruler (1:20). The transition from the level of the allegory to the level of the lesson—which Halevi does not provide but leaves to the reader’s understanding—indicates that the discussion by means of rational arguments concerning the Argument from Design ends in a state of equipollence of counterarguments. That is to say, a state in which none of the various alternatives at stake prevail over the others.

The continuation of the exchange between the Jewish sage and the Khazar king from this point in their dialogue turns toward the fideistic direction. The two speakers reach the conclusion here that although the establishment of God’s attributes, such as Him being the world’s governor, cannot be reached by means of rational inquiry, it can be reached based on the historical testimony of God’s exceptional involvement in the history of the people of Israel (1:21–25).

5.3.2 Equipollence of Counterarguments on the Issue of the Eternity of the World Versus its Creation in Time

While the first appearance of the skeptical measure regarding the equipollence of counterarguments in The Kuzari is implicit and disguised, its next appearance, in the context of the issue of the eternity of the world versus its creation in time, is explicit. The concluding remarks of the Jewish sage in the discussion that takes place between him and the Khazar king on this issue (1:43–67) are the clearest and most concentrated example of Halevi’s fideistic skepticism in The Kuzari. These remarks include, in a single sentence, both types of skeptical assertion, about the obscurity of this issue and about the equipollence of the counterarguments of eternity and of creation in time. In this context, Halevi uses the Arabic formulation dalāʾil al-ḥujjatayin mutakāfiʾa (“the two arguments counterbalance one another”), reminiscent of the term takāfuʾ al-adillah which is the Arabic equivalent of Greek term isostheneia (Heck, 2013, 15, 75–81. 197–198).

The assertion, supported by two skeptical measures, that the discussion on the issue of the world’s eternity versus its creation in time cannot be decided by means of rational arguments, allows the Jewish sage to transfer the discussion on the issue to the track of a fideistic discussion. He goes on to argue that the decision in favor of the creation of the world in time—although not necessarily creation ex nihilo—is achieved by relying on the tradition transmitted from Adam to Moses, a tradition supported by prophecy (1:67).

5.3.3 Equipollence of Counterarguments on the Issue of Explaining the Process of Giving Forms to Substances

In the discussion between the Jewish sage and the Khazar king at the opening of the fifth treatise of The Kuzari (5:2–6), Halevi reconstructs two philosophical doctrines known from the contemporary Islamicate philosophical literature. These doctrines offer different explanations for the process of giving forms to substances in the mundane world, which is the world beneath the lunar sphere according to theocentric cosmological theory (Davidson 1992, 76–82, 182–183). The differences between the two explanations under discussion are summarized in the query whether this process results from a super-intelligent entity or proceeds on its own without the intervention of such an entity.

The first explanation emphasizes the aspect of “chance,” according to which the determining factor in the issue under discussion is what Aristotelian physics refers to as the “natural place” of each of the four elements (fire, air, water, earth) in the space between the circumference and the center of the world beneath the lunar sphere. According to the second explanation, the forms given to mundane substances emanate from an entity called “the Giver of Forms.” This elevated entity is identified with the super-intelligent entity of the Active Intellect.

The discussion on the issue, which initially proceeds on a purely philosophical course (5:2–4), takes a theological turn when the Khazar king adopts the second explanation but chooses to identify the super-intelligent entity of the “Giver of Forms” not with the Active Intellect of the philosophers, but with God (5:5). In response, the Jewish sage shifts the discussion to the course of the skeptical-fideistic perspective. First, he states that those who point to the wisdom of a super-intelligent entity, either God or the Active Intellect, as the causing factor of the giving of forms, as well as those who entrust this task to “chance,” i.e. to the natural place of the elements, can both provide a satisfactory explanation for all the formal changes occurring in the mundane world. That is to say, the discussion on the issue has reached the state of equipollence of counterarguments, or as the Jewish sage comments to the Khazar king, “your opponent is on equal footing with you” (5:6).

From the Jewish sage’s point of view, the way to decide in favor of an explanation that attributes to God the giving of forms to substances lies in switching from the philosophical discourse to the fideistic discourse. For him, the decisive proof on the issue under discussion can be found in the exceptional history of the people of Israel, where the multitude of miracles involving the change of the forms of substances points to the existence of a divine wisdom operating in the giving of forms to all the substances in the mundane world (5:6).

5.4 Casting Doubts on Philosophical Doctrines

The measure of casting doubt is also integrated into the skeptical rationalist strategy that Halevi employs in a substantial number of places in the The Kuzari, when he argues against different doctrines of the philosophy of his time. Like the other skeptical measures, the measure of casting doubt is not aimed at establishing and proving a counterargument to the particular dogmatic philosophical argument it calls into question. The effectiveness of casting doubt lies in its pointing to weaknesses in the arguments that dogmatic philosophers bring to establish their doctrines. The use of this measure seeks to undermine the philosophers’ claim that their arguments constitute decisive proofs of those doctrines.

5.4.1 Casting Doubts on the Doctrine of the Separate Intellects

A common philosophical conception in Halevi’s time, expressed by the philosopher summoned to the Khazar king’s court, identifies God as the First Cause of the world’s existence (1:1). However, the world is characterized by the multiplicity and diversity of its beings, while God, according to the current philosophical terminology, is “One,” meaning a separate, unified entity that cannot be multiplied or divided. The question therefore arises: how can the One serve as the first cause for a world of multiple beings? The philosophical solution to this problem, to which the Jewish sage draws attention, is the solution that relies on the principle that “from the One, only one proceeds” (4:25). According to the philosophical explanation based on this principle, by knowing Himself as the First Cause, God emanates only one separate rational being. The multiplicity of beings is therefore the result of the continuation of the process that evolves from the emanation of that first being.

The one being that emanated from God, known as the First Separate Intellect, knows not only itself but also its Divine Cause. Accordingly, two beings emanate from it: another separate intellect and the highest sphere of the celestial world. The subsequent process of emanation of separate intellects and celestial spheres continues until the emanation of the lowest separate intellect, called the Active Intellect, and the parallel emanation of the mundane world, the world beneath the lunar sphere.

Basing himself on al-Ghazali (Wolfson 1977a, 11–13), Halevi casts doubt on this philosophical theory by raising several difficulties it entails. First, the way in which the process of emanation originating in God stops with the emanation of the Active Intellect creates an unexplained limitation on God’s ability. Second, since the creative principle in the emanation process is that of the emanated beings knowing themselves and the beings above them, this process should have led to a multiplicity of beings in the celestial world, far beyond the creation of one separate intellect and sphere at each and every stage of the described emanation process. Furthermore, according to the same creative principle, the philosopher, having perfected himself, should have emanated a sphere as one who knows himself, and a separate intellect as one who knows God, the First Cause, (4:25; 5:14).

In casting doubt by pointing to specific weaknesses in the philosophical emanation theory, Halevi seeks to undermine the confidence of those among his readers who were attracted to that philosophical doctrine. Beyond this, his fundamental critique of the philosophical doctrine of Separate Intellects is rooted in the author’s religious worldview. That critique appears in the final and concluding discussion that the Jewish sage dedicates to this doctrine. His main claim in this discussion is that the philosophical emanation doctrine “prompted the philosophers to multiply [the number of] deities.” This multiplicity infringes upon the unity and sovereignty of God to the extent that it makes the one who is tempted to accept this doctrine a heretic (5:21).

5.4.2 Casting Doubt on the Doctrine of the Immateriality and Immortality of the Rational Soul

Another topic that serves as a target for Halevi’s skeptic measure of casting doubt is the philosophical doctrine concerning the immateriality and immortality of the rational soul. Ibn Sina’s version of this doctrine is presented (anonymously) by the Jewish sage in a section of the fifth treatise of The Kuzari (5:12).

The Jewish sage supplements his presentation of Ibn Sina’s doctrine of the soul by casting doubt on the part of it related to the rational soul (5:14). His critique is divided into two parts. First, it focuses on the philosophical assertion that the rational soul is an immaterial substance, and therefore the processes of generation and corruption that affect material substances do not affect it. In this context, the Jewish sage mentions a list of ailments and diseases that afflict human beings, including philosophers—drunkenness, fever, a blow that damages the brain, old age and senility, melancholy, and mental illness. Each of these afflictions can cause the affected person to forget the knowledge he has acquired and to change his personality. These occurrences, which human life is prone to, cast doubt onthe philosophers’ claim regarding the immunity of the rational soul from material processes of decay.

Then the Jewish sage moves on to cast doubt on the assertion about the immortality of the rational soul, which is derived from the philosophical assertion that this particular soul can achieve a status which makes it independent of bodily forces. In this context, the Jewish sage raises a difficulty regarding the scope of knowledge that the one who perfects himself in the philosophical sciences must acquire so that his rational soul will attain independence from the bodily forces and immortality upon the destruction of his bodily limbs. One possibility is that achieving this status requires acquiring full and comprehensive knowledge. If so, then this is a goal that no one can achieve, since even the philosopher cannot acquire knowledge about everything that exists in the heavens, on earth, and in the sea. The other possibility is that achieving the immortality of the rational soul requires acquiring only partial knowledge. If so, then this is a relatively easy goal to achieve, which many can complete in a short time. This possibility is problematic from the philosophers’ elitist point of view.

In this case as well, the measure of casting doubt is intended to undermine the readers’ confidence in the validity of this philosophical doctrine and not much more. Faithful to his fideistic-skeptical approach, Halevi concludes the discussion with the Jewish sage’s assertion that the issue of the rational soul’s immateriality and immortality is one of the theological issues that cannot be decided by means of rational inquiry. Those who debate about it in this manner would waste their lives in vain, without succeeding in reaching a decisive conclusion about it. In Halevi’s opinion, the Jewish reader does not need the doubtful proofs of philosophy about the soul’s immateriality and immortality. He should rely on what the tradition of his religion provides him on this matter, since this tradition was transmitted by reliable transmitters (5:14).

5.4.3 Casting Doubt on the Doctrine of the Four Elements

The Jewish sage finds it appropriate to cast doubt on the philosophical doctrine of the four elements – fire, air, water, and earth – which serve as building blocks of all the material substances in the mundane world. The doubt that the Jewish sage raises in this matter concerns the need to empirically verify this physical doctrine. The Jewish sage’s position is that the empirical test confirms the philosophical doctrine regarding the role of the four primary qualities— hotness, coldness, wetness, and dryness —in the processes of generation and corruption of material substances. We can identify, by means of empirical observation, the existence and involvement of these four qualities in these processes.

In contrast, the empirical tests do not confirm the philosophical doctrine regarding the role reserved for the four elements in those processes. Our observational attempts to capture and diagnose the appearance of these elements in their purity, during the operation of the processes of generation and corruption in nature, are destined to fail, except perhaps in rare cases, too rare to generalize from them sweeping theoretical conclusions as the philosophers do (5:14).

In the continuation of the same discussion, the Jewish sage creates a connection between the doctrine of the four elements and a philosophical doctrine with clear theological implications, that of the eternity of the world. The connection between these two doctrines suggests that the processes of generation and corruption of matter in the mundane world are eternal, without a starting or ending point. Hence, the existence of the four elements in a pure and separate manner has never actually happened and never will. And if so, then the assumption regarding their separate existence is not susceptible to observational verification. It must therefore be treated as a purely theoretical matter whose actual existence is doubtful.

The Jewish sage concludes the discussion on the issue under discussion in a manner consistent with the fideistic approach that characterizes Halevi’s attitude toward philosophical issues with theological implications. He directs his interlocutor, the Khazar king, to the opinion he calls the “opinion of the Divine Law.” According to this opinion, the mundane world with all its objects and the forms given to them was created by God at the time He wished, and in the manner that He wished. Accepting this opinion will spare the Khazar king and the readers of The Kuzari the trouble of toiling in the inquiry of the generation of material substances, as well as the inquiry of related and other issues (5:14). At the same time, adherence to what is identified here as the “opinion of the Divine Law” saves the author of The Kuzari the need to provide alternative explanations to those presented by the philosophers in their discussions of these issues (Langermann, 1997, 509–512).

In the same section from the fifth treatise of the dialogue in which the Jewish sage casts doubt on various philosophical doctrines, he also supports his efforts to do so using a claim of a different order, essential in nature. This claim, which he first presented in the book’s first treatise, regards the unbridgeable hierarchical-ontological difference between the chosen of humanity—among whom are those who have reached prophecy and those who have the potential to be prophets—and all those unchosen human beings, who, due to their lower status on the hierarchical scale of creatures in the mundane world, lack the ability to reach the degree of prophecy.

In the first treatise, where this claim is presented in detail (1:27;1:31–43; 1:47; 1:95; 1:103; 1:15), it does not refer to the philosophers (Krinis, 2014). However, in its abbreviated appearance in the fifth treatise, it is directed toward them. According to what the Jewish sage has to say here, philosophers’ shortcomings stem not only from limitations of the rational measures, but also from their inferior position on the hierarchical scale. The mere human nature of the philosophers, who are explicitly identified throughout the book as Greeks, limits them and does not allow them to achieve what is directly accessible only to those human beings whose nature is not limited to the human degree, but includes a supra-human component that opens their way to prophecy (5:14).

6. Signs of God’s Presence and the Ways to Perceive Them

The issue of the signs of God’s presence and the ways to perceive and experience these signs stands at the center of The Kuzari. Halevi’s uniqueness and greatness as a religious thinker rests to a large extent on the emphasis he gave to this issue in his thought. The Jewish thinkers and authors preceding him and his contemporaries were not particularly troubled by this issue, but for Halevi, this is the main point.

In his understanding, there is a huge gap that requires explanation between the multitude of manifestations of Divine Presence, such as miracles and prophecy, in the distant past of the people of Israel, and the almost complete absence of these manifestations in the current period, the prolonged period of exile of the people from the Holy Land. This gap is the great common theme of his poetry and thought. In many places in his poetry, Halevi gave an intensified emotional expression to the pain and frustration he felt in the face of the gap between the glory of the people of Israel in the distant past, when signs of their closeness to God were abundant, and the suffering and humiliation that are the lot of the people in the reality of exile, when manifestations of God’s presence are almost completely absent (Alfonso 2008, 94–96). In The Kuzari, he seeks not only to point out this sharp gap but also to diagnose it, in a way that points to a direction that may lead to restoration of the manifestations of God’s presence in the history of people of Israel.

The prominent feature in The Kuzari that attests to the special importance that Halevi attributes to the issue of the signs of God’s presence, and the possibility of perceiving and experiencing them, is the frequent appearance throughout the book of the term “the Divine Thing” (al-amr al-ilāhī). As far as Jewish thought is concerned, the use of this term is an innovation of Halevi. It does not appear in the works of his predecessors and contemporaries, certainly not in a systematic manner. In The Kuzari, however, it is the central term. Its centrality in the book stems from the fact that Halevi chose it as an all-encompassing term to denote the Divine Presence. This Divine Presence is expressed in a variety of phenomena that distinguish the existence of God’s chosen and of the people of Israel as the chosen people of God from the existence of the rest of the human beings and the nations (Davidson 1972, 381–395; Wolfson 1977b, 68–85, Pines, 1980, 165–192; Lobel, 2006; Krinis 2014, 189–223).

6.1 The Inadequacy of Philosophical Epistemology in Perceiving the Signs of God’s Presence

The centrality reserved in Halevi’s thought for the experience of the manifestations of God’s presence has a far-reaching implication for his critique of philosophy. The claim that Halevi formulates in The Kuzari is that the rationalistic epistemology that was best developed and refined by the philosophers is not the appropriate way to perceive and experience the signs of God’s presence (4:3).

In Halevi’s understanding, the signs of God’s presence are sensory signs, as in the case of miracles, or perceptible signs as in the case of prophecy. Furthermore, the manifestations of the Divine Presence are concrete and unique manifestations. They occur in specific historical circumstances and not in others and are experienced by specific individuals and groups and not by others, and in specific places. God is in the details, yet the philosophers seek to find Him in the universal: in the regularities of the nature when it comes to physics, and in claims with general validity regarding the relations between God and the world when comes to metaphysics. Thus, philosophers’ epistemology does not account for anything that is concrete, unique, and circumstantial in God’s presence in the world.

In the previous part of our discussion, we saw that Halevi, in accordance with his fideistic-skeptical approach, casts doubt on and minimizes the range of efficacy of the philosophical methods of inference in achieving the universal goals they set for themselves. What is not in doubt, according to him, is that the rationalistic epistemology of the philosophers is unsuitable and ineffective regarding the achievement of the truly sublime goal from the religious point of view that interests him: the goal of perceiving and experiencing the signs of God’s presence in the world.

Halevi emphasizes the inadequacy of philosophical epistemology in the interpretation he gives to the difference between two biblical names of God: the name Elohim and the explicit name (YHVH – the Tetragrammaton). The optimal use that the philosophers made of the methods of rational inference granted them the kind of apprehension of God symbolized by the name Elohim. This apprehension does point to God as the force that brings reality into existence by virtue of His being the first cause of this reality (1:1). It may also lead to the conclusion that God is the establisher of the order prevailing in the world (4:15). However, this picture is of a Deity whose essence is exalted and elevated above the world and is not at all accessible to its inhabitants (1:1; 1:8; 1:68; 4:1). Such a God is a Deity whose presence is distant, indirect and mediated, to the extent that He is one “who neither harms us nor benefits us, knows nothing of our prayers and sacrifices, and nothing of our obedience and disobedience” (4:3).

In contrast, the Tetragrammaton, as God’s personal name, symbolizes the apprehension of His direct presence in the reality of the lives of His chosen ones. For example, Adam, as the first of God’s chosen ones, would not apprehend God—that is, experience the signs of His presence, “had He not addressed him, rewarded him, punished him, and created Eve for him from one of his own ribs” (4:3). Similarly, God’s chosen among the descendants of Adam were granted knowledge of God by His personal name, because they alone experienced the direct signs of His presence, primarily prophecy (4:3; 4:15). At a later stage, the people of Israel were privileged to be called “the people of YHVH,” because the signs of His presence appeared and were experienced in the sphere of their history, and not in the sphere of the history of the other nations (2:32; 4:3).

6.2 The Ways that Lead to Perceiving the Signs of God’s Presence

Judah Halevi’s interpretation regarding the distinct difference between the apprehension of God symbolized by the name Elohim and His apprehension symbolized by His explicit personal name relies on the claim regarding the exclusive appearance of the signs of God’s presence in the course of the history of God’s chosen ones and chosen people (Harvey, 1988; Harvey, 2007; Ben-Sasson, 2019, 151–158). This claim, in turn, rests on the fundamental hierarchical-ontological distinction that points to an unbridgeable gap between the degree of God’s chosen ones and the degree of the unchosen among all of humanity (4:15).

However, for Halevi, as far as the critique of philosophy is concerned, it is not this aspect but the epistemological aspect of his interpretation of God’s names that more fruitfully reflects the difference and tension between the God of Israel and the God of the philosophers. In this context, Halevi points to two alternative ways to that of philosophical rational epistemology, by means of which the signs of the Divine Presence can be perceived.

The first way is based on outwardly directed sensory apprehension. This way is open to the entire chosen people and concerns the appearance of the signs of God’s presence in public-historical settings. The second way is based on inwardly directed senses. It is relevant for chosen individuals and concerns the mystical-prophetic apprehension of God’s presence.

6.2.1 Apprehending the Signs of God’s Presence Through the Senses and Tradition

When the Khazar king summons the Jewish sage to his court, he asks him to present the core principles of his faith. Responding to this request, the Jewish sage points primarily to the signs of the Divine Presence in the history of the people of Israel, as they were revealed in the miracles accompanying the events of the Exodus from Egypt, the mission of Moses at the giving of the Torah, and the great number of prophets who arose from the people of Israel following Moses (1:11).

This presentation by the sage of Judaism’s principles of faith disappoints the Khazar king. He expected to hear a presentation of the core principles of a religion, composed of universal truths such as God being “the Creator of the world, who orders it and governs it” (1:12)—that is, the dogmas of religion that the Jewish sage calls the “syllogistic, governmental religion to which inquiry leads,” and which the philosophers frequently engage in (1:13).

From this starting point, the discussion in the opening dialogue between the Jewish sage and the Khazar king (1:11–25) proceeds on two levels. The first is the critical level, where the two debaters point to weaknesses in the “syllogistic, governmental religion” based on a rationalistic epistemology. Those weaknesses are the disagreement among philosophers about it and the equipollence of counterarguments applicable to one of its central proofs (see sections 5.1, 5.3 above). The second level is where the Jewish sage formulates in great brevity an alternative epistemology to the rational-philosophical one, one that is suitable for perceiving and transmitting the public signs of God’s presence in the history of the people of Israel (Krinis 2020, 35–61).

The miraculous events that happened to the people of Israel, such as the plagues of Egypt and the parting of the Red Sea, were public events whose tangibility is clear and impressive, to the extent that, in the opinion of the Jewish sage, they do not require confirmation and proof by reason. Direct sensory perception (al-ʿiyān) is sufficient to grasp and confirm their truth for those who actually experienced them (1:11; 1:15). Since miracles like the plagues of Egypt or the parting of the Red Sea, exceptional as they are, are historical events, the question arises as to the way that ensures the most reliable transmission of knowledge about them to those who did not experience them, including those of future generations. In this context, the Jewish sage presents the doctrine of “concurrent tradition” (tawātur), i.e. a report transmitted through multiple and separate chains of transmitters (1:25; 1:89; 5:14).

Traditional knowledge, that is reports passed orally from mouth to ear and from generation to generation, held a central place in the Jewish culture of late antiquity and in the culture of early Islam. In the Muslim culture, knowledge transmitted across generations through multiple and separate chains of transmitters was considered knowledge with the highest degree of reliability (Nasser 2013, 65–78). It is considered so because the correspondence maintained in all the transmissions of its content, along with the multiplicity of transmitters and the separation maintained between its chains of transmitters, nullify the possibility that such knowledge could be distorted through conspiracy and coordination of versions (1:48; 3:24; 3:73; 4:3; 4:11).

Thus, the epistemology associated with the reception and transmission of the signs of the Divine Presence revealed in public events includes two complementary components: their apprehension through the direct sensory perception of those who were direct witnesses to them; and the transmission of their testimony to others who were not present at these events as a “concurrent tradition” through multiple and separate chains of transmitters.

The differences between the epistemology relying on these two components and rationalistic-philosophical epistemology are summarized in the following two points. First, the type of knowledge: it is knowledge about a specific tangible event exposed to the direct apprehension of the senses, not knowledge consisting of universal generalizations. Second, the method of verification of the knowledge: verification that relies on the manner of transmission of the knowledge through transmitters, and not on its verification by means of rational arguments and proofs.

The distinction between the two epistemologies allows the Jewish sage to conclude the first discussion between him and the Khazar king with his own interpretation of the first of the Ten Commandments. At the foundational occasion of the revelation at Mount Sinai, God presented Himself to the people of Israel, not with a declaration such as “I am the Creator of the world and your Creator,” but with the declaration “I am God, whom you worship, who brought you out of the land of Egypt.” That is to say, He did not address them by way of an ahistorical universal statement about the relationship between Him and the world, a way of presentation that lends itself to verification by means of rational proofs. Instead, He addressed them by way of referring to His involvement in the miraculous historical events that they themselves witnessed and experienced. This way of presentation is the one that lends itself to perception and verification by means of the combination of direct sensory experience and faithful transmission guaranteed by the “concurrent tradition” (1:25).

6.2.2 Perceiving the Signs of God’s Presence Through the Internal Senses and Mystical Experience

According to Halevi’s understanding, prophecy is the ultimate experience of closeness to God, fear of Him, and love of Him. He was well aware of the attempts by Muslim philosophers to explain the phenomenon of prophecy as a possible consequence of the philosopher’s state of attachment to the Active Intellect, having prepared himself and attained intellectual perfection (1:1; 1:87; 4:3; 5:14). The presumption of the philosophers of his time and culture to provide an explanation for prophecy in terms of intellectual perfection and relation with an intermediary entity posed a special challenge for Halevi and elicited from him particularly strong polemical tones.

In the sayings he ascribes to the Jewish sage and the Khazar king during their debate in the fourth treatise of The Kuzari, Halevi takes great pains to show how unworthy the philosophers are of prophecy. Following their discussion in the opening dialogue of the first treatise, the discussion between the Jewish sage and the Khazar king in the fourth treatise points out how the philosophers’ focus on abstract rational thought, which strives to achieve universal generalizations, is a highly unsuitable way for perceiving and experiencing the signs of God’s presence. However, within the framework of the sage and the king’s lengthy discussion about prophecy, Halevi goes into greater detail in clarifying the weaknesses of the philosophers’ path and the serious implications of their adherence to this path from a religious point of view.

The critical approach Halevi presents in this discussion can be summarized in the following points:

• Human intellectual capacity is characterized by its ability to focus on only one thing at any given time, while prophecy, for its part, is characterized by being a holistic apprehension in which the prophet grasps many things at once (4:5–6).
• Philosophical thinking strives for abstraction and thereby tries to overcome images. However, images, whether produced by direct sensory perceptions or assisted by imagination, are essential for human perception across the board. In the case of prophecy, this involves visualization assisted by imagination for the purpose of receiving visions of the sublime Divine world. These visions are not accessible to one who adopts the path of intellectual abstraction (4:3–5).
• The above-mentioned critique by Halevi of the philosophers’ denial of the centrality of images and imagination for the religious experience in general, and for prophecy in particular, entails a far-reaching psychological implication. Human emotional motivation needs visualization. In the absence of visualization, the emotions of fear of God and love of God, which are the essential emotions for devotion to God and for accepting the yoke of His service, will not be aroused in human beings. Fear of God and love of Him are established in prophets’ hearts immediately upon their experience of the tangible, stunning experience of the prophetic vision (4:3–5). In comparison, the philosophers’ focus on abstract thinking that leads to the apprehension of the intelligible greatly limits their psychological motivational capacity regarding the arousal of the essential emotions of fear of God and love of Him. Consequently, the philosopher’s motivation lies not in his desire to fulfill God’s will, but in his effort to achieve intellectual perfection, so that his intellect will rise to the stage of unifying attachment with the Active Intellect. To achieve this goal, the philosopher needs to apprehend all the intelligibles and the sciences. Therefore, for the philosopher, the apprehension of God’s reality and unity is no more than the apprehension of one intelligible among the many he needs to apprehend (1:1; 4:13; 4:19). It is no surprise, then, that the philosopher’s commitment to religious law is superficial and weak. For him, this law is, at most, “fine manners.” There is also an opportunistic dimension to the philosopher’s attitude toward religious law. He observes this law only as long as it does not harm him and he does not suffer difficulties because of it (4:15–16; 4:19).

The main alternative that Halevi presents to the philosophical explanation of prophecy relies on the decisive role reserved for what the Jewish sage calls the “internal sense” in the process of prophecy. In the discussion he develops on the matter, the sage names several terms referring to several such internal senses, including the “internal eye” (al-ʿayn al-bāṭina), “sight” (baṣīrah), “taste” (dawq), and “vision” (mushāhada). These terms are familiar from Muslim Sufi literature, where they are described not only as internal senses but also as internal mystical states (Efros, 1941; Lobel 2000, 89–120; Harvey 2006, 292–293). As in Sufi literature, so too in The Kuzari, the use of the internal senses leads the user to a mystical experience of complete devotion to the love of God (4:3; 4:15–16). Halevi emphasizes that the internal sense is a special aptitude with which the prophets were endowed. The Greek philosophers, as those who were not endowed with such an aptitude and were forced to rely on their inferences alone, could not perceive or confirm the tangible visions revealed to the prophets through their internal sense (4:3).

In a high point of that discussion, the Khazar king raises the distinction between “the God of Abraham and the God of Aristotle.” This distinction returns to the difference between the apprehension of the name Elohim and the apprehension of God’s explicit personal name, i.e., the issue with which the discussion on prophecy opened in the fourth treatise of The Kuzari. Aristotle, the paragon of the philosophers, reached through his intellect a purely theoretical apprehension only of the name Elohim. Thus, his apprehension of God remained an obscure, doubtful, and non-binding matter. For Abraham, the exemplary believer, who was privileged to receive prophecy and the apprehension of the God’s explicit personal name through the internal senses, the prophetic experience he underwent was a life-changing event. It caused him not only to leave his father’s household and the land where he was born, but also to abandon the theoretical-philosophical sciences with which he had previously occupied himself (4:15–16).

Aristotle took the way of philosophy, and Abraham took the way of prophecy. From Halevi’s perspective, these are two separate ways, and only the second of them truly leads to God (4:27).

Bibliography

Primary Works

Editions of the Original Text and Translations of The Kuzari from Arabic to English

• Das Buch Al-Chazari des Abû-l-Hasan Jehuda Hallewi im Arabischen Urtext sowie in der Hebräischen Ubersetzung des Jehuda Ibn Tibbon, Hartwig Hirschfeld (ed.), Leipzig: Otto Schulze, 1887.
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• Kitâb al-radd wa’l-dalîl fî’l-dîn al-dhalîl (al-kitâb al-khazarî), David H. Baneth and Haggai Ben-Shammai (eds.), Jerusalem: Magnes, 1977.
• The Kuzari–The Book of Refutation and Proof on the Despised Faith, transliterated into Arabic and edited by Nabih Bashir with the assistance of ‘Abed ‘l-Salam Mousa, Freiburg an Niedersachsen: Al-Kamel, 2012.
• The Book of Refutation and Proof on Behalf of the Despised Religion (The Kuzari), forthcoming, Barry S. Kogan (tr.), New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.

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Other Important Works

• Altmann, Alexander 1944 [2005], “Judah Halevi’s Theory of Climates” (in Hebrew), Melilah, 1–17; translated in Lenn Schramm (ed.), Aleph: Historical Studies in Science and Judaism, 5(1): 215–246. doi:10.1353/ale.2005.0002
• Davidson, Herbert A., 1987, Proofs for Eternity, Creation and the Existence of God in Medieval Islamic and Jewish Philosophy, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press.
• Goodman, Lenn E., 1997, “Judah Halevi”, in Daniel H. Frank and Oliver Leaman (eds.), History of Jewish Philosophy, London: Routledge, pp. 188–227.
• Guttman, Julius, 1964, “Judah Halevi”, in D. W. Silverman (tr.), Philosophies of Judaism, Philadelphia: Jewish Publication Society, pp. 120–133.
• Husik, Isaac, 1944, “Judah Halevi”, A History of Medieval Jewish Philosophy, Philadelphia: Jewish Publication Society, pp. 150–183.
• Jospe, Raphael, 2009, “Judah La-Levi and the Critique of Philosophy”, Jewish Philosophy in the Middle Ages, Brighton, MA: Academic Studies Press, pp. 237–319.
• Kogan, Barry S., 2003, “Judah Halevi and his Use of Philosophy in the Kuzari”, in Daniel H. Frank and Oliver Leaman (eds.), The Cambridge Companion to Medieval Jewish Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 111–135.
• –––, 2004, “Who Has Implanted Within Us Eternal Life: Judah Halevi on Immortality and the Afterlife”, in Jonathan W. Malino (ed.), Judaism and Modernity: The Religious Philosophy of David Hartman, Aldershot: Ashgate, pp. 445–463.
• –––, 2009, “Understanding Prophecy: Four Traditions”, in Steven Nadler and T. M. Rudavsky (eds.), The Cambridge History of Jewish Philosophy: From Antiquity through the Seventeenth Century, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 481–523.
• Kreisel, Howard, 1993, “Judah Halevi’s Kuzari: Between the God of Abraham and the God of Aristotle”, in R. Munk and F. J. Hoogewoud (eds.), Joodse Filosofie tussen Rede en Tradite, Kampen: Kok, pp. 24–34.
• –––, 2001, Prophecy: The History of an Idea in Medieval Jewish Philosophy, Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Lasker, Daniel J., 1990, “Proselyte Judaism, Christianity and Islam in the Thought of Judah Halevi”, Jewish Quarterly Review, 81(1–2): 75–91.
• –––, 2013, “Judah Halevi as a Philosopher – Some Preliminary Comments”, in A. Ashur (ed.), Judaeo-Arabic Culture in al-Andalus, Cordoba: Cordoba University Press, pp. 99–109.
• Lorberbaum, Menachem, 2011, We Have Been Vanquished by His Pleasantness: The Doctrine of Divinity as Poetry in Andalusian Jewish Creativity (in Hebrew), Jerusalem: Machon Ben Zvi, pp. 159–200.
• Nuriel, Avraham, 1990, “The Divine Will in the Kuzari” (in Hebrew), Jerusalem Studies in Jewish Thought, 9: 19–32.
• Pines, Shlomo, 1988, “On the Term ‘Ruhaniyyut’ and its Origin, and on Judah Ha-Levi’s Teaching” (in Hebrew), Tarbitz, 57: 511–534.
• Schwartz, Dov, 2005, Studies on Astral Magic in Medieval Jewish Thought, D. Louvish and B. Stein (trans.), Leiden: Brill.
• Sinai, Nicolai, 2003, Menschliche oder göttliche Weisheit? Zum Gegensatz von philosophischem und religiösem Lebensideal bei al-Ghazali und Yehuda ha-Levi, Wurzburg: Ergon.
• Sirat, Colette, 1985, “Judah Halevi”, A History of Jewish Philosophy in the Middle Ages, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 113–131.
• Strauss, Leo, 1952, “The Law of Reason in the Kuzari”, Persecution and the Art of Writing, Glencoe, IL: The Free Press, pp. 95–141.

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• Kogan, Barry, “Judah Halevi”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2026 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2026/entries/halevi/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

Related Entries

Aristotle | cosmological argument | eternity, in Christian thought | fideism | God: and other ultimates | Ibn Bâjja [Avempace] | imagination | miracles | prophecy | skepticism: ancient