B. Suggestive, But Inconclusive, Lines of Research into Nativism

I have focused on PoS arguments in spelling out the case for linguistic nativism. This is because I find these the most compelling and most likely to promote fruitful research, but also because, when presented well, they make clearest what is assumed, and how a non-nativist proposal could be constructed in response. Specifically, for whichever piece of linguistic knowledge is being appealed to in such an argument, an empiricist counter must show either: (i) that this is not really acquired by language learners (i.e., to reject or re-analyze the data that was taken to demonstrate the relevant knowledge), (ii) show that there is sufficient information in the environment for learners to extract this knowledge, or (iii) show that whatever innate knowledge/systems/biases are required to acquire this knowledge are not specific to language. This dialectic, I believe, has provided the most fruitful discussion of the nativism/empiricism debate to this point.

However, there are also a number of other phenomena which are often appealed to in these debates. For each of these, there are plausible evidential connections between the purported facts and linguistic nativism, but they are more tenuous and sketchy. While these occasionally generate flurries of interest, they have each tended to dissolve upon closer inspection. The uncertainty and unclarity around these issues has generally led to theorists on either side of the nativism/empiricism debate adopting whichever, underdetermined, analysis of the phenomena comports with their own preferred view. I list them here, however, as a full understanding of the shape of these debates will involve knowing how the arguments worked, and why they proved inconclusive, but also in the spirit of methodological omnivorism: for difficult theoretical questions, we should be open to help from data from surprising sources (Antony 2003; Currie 2018; Jerry Fodor 1991). There are causal connections between innateness and these phenomena, and the fact that prior research has not decisively identified them to everyone’s satisfaction should not discourage future researchers from trying to do so.

• B.1 Speed and Ease
• B.2 Double Dissociation
• B.3 Neurolinguistics
• B.4 Genetics/FoxP2
• B.5 Language Universals
• B.6 Critical/Sensitive Periods

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B.1 Speed and Ease

Linguistic nativists, especially when introducing their theory, frequently appeal to the “speed and ease” (see, e.g., Goodluck 2020: 102) with which children learn their language. At an intuitive level, there is of course something remarkable, if not miraculous, about young children’s progress in acquiring their native tongue. Jackendoff (1993) coined the phrase “the paradox of language acquisition” to reflect the puzzling fact that, barring pathology, all human children manage to acquire fluency in their native language, whereas generations of linguists dedicating their lives to the task of identifying the rules governing a language have not succeeded. Similar comparisons are often made between children and adults: if I, and a baby born today in Beijing, both begin the process of learning Mandarin, you would be wise to bet on the baby’s success over mine, despite the fact that I am, I hope, in other respects more cognitively capable, at least at this stage. And, one more comparison, languages are learned, seemingly without much needed in the way of a structured environment, by all children; whereas skills which seem drastically less complex overall, such as learning arithmetic or how to play the lute, are highly unevenly distributed throughout the population, result in radically varying degrees of competency, and require substantial caretaker investment.

The nativist argues: what could explain this remarkable capacity, if not the fact that the child has a head start? The child already knows the major outlines of the end result, but the linguist, in her conscious theory-construction, does not.

This is intuitively a powerful case. But it relies on a seemingly irremediable vagueness, which precludes serious theorizing. Most obviously, there is no clear notion of the ‘speed’ of acquisition. How long might we expect language learners to take if they didn’t have an innate boost? Without a tolerably clear comparison here, it is not clear what to make of these claims, beyond their rhetorical value. And while there clearly are developmental differences between acquiring a language and learning to play the lute, there are also significant environmental differences. Even in communities in which children get relatively minimal interaction with, or feedback from, caregivers, they are still embedded in an environment saturated with language. Even the most demanding parent can’t replicate this resource for their child’s music practice. The paradox of language acquisition seems susceptible to similar sorts of response. While children do seem better at learning the rules of languages than linguists, they also seem better at learning the rules of whatever non-innate traits they develop. And even the best supported linguistic theories will be sensitive to a much smaller data set than the child is exposed to. Similar points can be raised about the ‘ease’ with which a child learns a language. What notion of effort is being appealed to here? Children definitely spend a lot of cognitive energy and attention on linguistic stimuli. How much more would be needed to establish that language learning is hard? The apparent absence of answers to questions like this suggests we ought not place too much weight on these styles of argument for linguistic nativism.

B.2 Double Dissociation

More substantively, since Jerry Fodor (1983), many theorists have connected claims about innateness with claims about modularity (see Robbins & Drayson 2009 [2025] for discussion). And indeed, much of Fodor’s discussion was motivated explicitly by Chomsky’s claims (although see Chomsky 2017 and Collins 2004 for differences between the two). While there is no entailment relation between modularity and innateness (see, e.g., Karmiloff-Smith 1992), it does seem that establishing that human language is something like a modular system would support the case for nativism.

For this reason, much has been made of the apparent existence of double dissociations, cases in which language is impaired while other cognitive systems are spared, or vice versa. If language and some other system can be differentially impaired, this suggests that they must be differentially treated by the brain, e.g., processed in different neurobiological systems, a characteristic property of modularity. And if modularity is evidence of nativism, then such cases support the linguistic nativist.

Various such cases have been discussed. Broca’s aphasia is a condition in which subjects can understand language more-or-less normally, but have severe difficulties in producing it, particularly in the ‘functional’ aspects of speech, i.e., morphosyntax. Wernicke’s aphasia presents roughly the opposite symptoms: an inability to interpret the speech or writing of others, but normal levels of grammaticality in their utterances (although often with semantic or pragmatic deficiencies). Both are typically, but not universally, caused by strokes or other traumatic brain injuries, and are thus often interpreted as reflecting what happens when a ‘language center’ is unable to perform normally.

The first thing to note about such cases is that these descriptions are highly idealized. Conditions diagnosed as Broca’s or Wernicke’s aphasia reflect a number of different causes, and present a wide range of symptoms, suggesting something more like a syndrome, shaped by diagnostic practice, rather than a psychological kind. Secondly, as noted, even if the dissociations here between language perception and production are evidence of modularity, nativist conclusions do not follow. As Karmiloff-Smith and others have argued (e.g., Heyes 2018; Bates, Bretherton, & Snyder 1988) modules could be the end-point of developmental processes, not the start point. Thirdly, it is plausible that the neurobiological mechanisms which are harmed in these cases of aphasia are dedicated to the mapping of linguistic forms onto physical stimuli (in perception) or motor signals (in production). If this is right, then these cases are not plausibly viewed as demonstrating something like a Chomskian language faculty, which is supposed to be strictly a matter of the internal generation of linguistic structures.

Other kinds of cases involve much more general cognitive deficits. Williams syndrome is frequently cited, wherein patients display relatively low intelligence, especially on certain kinds of spatial reasoning tasks, but with fewer and less severe impairments to their linguistic capacities (although see Bellugi et al. 2000 for discussion of the complexity of the symptoms here). In the other direction, Specific Language Impairment (SLI), most thoroughly studied in the case of one multi-generational British family, dubbed the ‘KE family’ (Gopnik & Crago 1991), presents as a cluster of special difficulties with language, both in production and perception, despite otherwise normal cognitive profiles. Again, the actual symptomology is debated, as is the question of whether SLI is, in fact, language-specific. Ullman and Pierpont (2005) compellingly argue that SLI is better viewed as reflecting a deficit in the procedural memory system. So, again, the observations in this area are suggestive of different cognitive systems for linguistic and non-linguistic tasks, but are too messy to hang much weight on, and inferences from this claim to claims about innateness are fraught for the same reasons as the aphasia cases.

The final, and perhaps most widely discussed case, involves linguistic savants, who seem to have atypical abilities to learn languages, despite cognitive impairments elsewhere. Smith and Tsimpli (1995) remains the most concrete such discussion, of a subject, Christopher, who despite receiving IQ scores well below average range (ranging from 42–76), displays competence in over a dozen languages (the number is hard to determine exactly, as Christopher’s ability varies from full fluency in some languages to more basic grasp in others) from a wide range of language families (including, e.g., Welsh, Spanish, Greek, Danish, Finnish, Hindi, and Turkish) and using several different scripts, and displays a remarkable ability to pick up novel, even artificial, languages quickly. Smith and Tsimpli argue in line with the discussion above from the dissociation between general intelligence and linguistic abilities, to claims about the modularity of language, and from there to claims about innateness. This argument is bolstered by Christopher’s inability to pick up an artificial language which violates hypothesized constraints imposed by Universal Grammar. Christopher’s abilities, they argue, are thus enabled not by a domain general ability to identify and extrapolate patterns, but specifically an ability to learn languages, as delimited by UG.

This analysis of the case of Christopher, and its implications, has however been strongly rebuffed by Bates (1997). Bates argues that Christopher’s unusual cognitive profile may instead be explained as reflective of someone with an unusual interest in language (akin to the “hyperfixation” characteristic of other forms of neurodiversity), and who has therefore dedicated significantly more resources (time, effort, attention) to learning about language, and thus has developed atypical language learning skills more than average children, who focus their attention on other topics, rather than as the unimpaired working of a dedicated innate module. Bates points out that while Christopher’s general intelligence is low relative to others in his age group, his mental age is at least that of children by the time they have mastered their own native language, and so it seems that whatever “cognitive prerequisites” there are for language acquisition, Christopher seems likely to have them.

B.3 Neurolinguistics

Linguistics, in a cognitive vein, has long promised evidentially beneficial connections with neuroscience. One might hope that the cognitive neuroscience of language, which has made significant progress in the last couple of decades, could contribute towards the debates over the innateness, or otherwise, of language. However, for similar reasons as the above cases, it is difficult to establish any firm conclusions, beyond tantalizing suggestions, one way or the other.

Some notable work (Musso et al. 2003) tested neural responses in subjects faced with the task of learning some rules in a novel language. The key variable was whether the language was compatible with hypothesized principles of language, i.e., with UG, or whether it violated these principles (e.g., it was not structure-dependent). What Musso et al. found was that different brain areas responded differently to these two tasks: specifically, learning novel real languages (e.g., Japanese) triggered activity in Broca’s area, whereas learning an artificial, non-structure-dependent, language relied instead on activity in other parts of the brain, specifically those involved in more general, i.e., non-linguistic, problem-solving. The authors took this to confirm a broadly generativist approach to language. This research also comports with the significant work of Angela Friederici, who has argued (e.g., Friederici 2018) that Broca’s area (more precisely, BA 44, a posterior part of Broca’s area; see Fedorenko & Blank 2020 for discussion of the functional heterogeneity of Broca’s area) is the locus of specifically syntactic computation. Friederici supports this work with functional imaging and neuroanatomical studies of this area in cross-task (e.g., a differential responses in human subjects in response to linguistic phrases vs. lists of words) and cross-species experiments.

As always, a difficulty with drawing inferences about innateness from this neurobiological research is that claims about the functionality of specific brain areas are highly controversial. This is exacerbated by the wide range of cognitive capacities involved in the use of language. Fedorenko, Ivanova, and Regev (2024) argue for the existence of a “language network”, a neurobiological system defined at a significantly higher level of grain. This network, they argue, is responsive to (nearly) all aspects of linguistic usage (including speaking, speech perception, lexical decision, and even indisputably non-innate systems like reading and writing), but dissociated from thought, perception, and motor control. It is, however, tightly integrated, with all such functions producing significant activity across the whole system. This proposal casts doubt on the proposed claims about the specificity of any area (e.g., BA 44) for one dedicated linguistic phenomenon, e.g., syntax/Merge.

The other problem is that such work establishes, at most, neurobiological specialization in adult language users. That is, dedicated brain systems for language (or, syntax) could arise as a result either of shaping by innate biases, or due to acquired/developed specialization due to a lifetime of interacting with linguistic stimuli (Karmiloff-Smith 1992, Bates 1997, and others). Thus, again, it is difficult to draw firm conclusions about innateness, an essentially developmental claim, from facts about the products of development.

There is an even more indirect role for the cognitive neuroscience of language to play in these debates. As noted, PoS arguments necessarily rely on claims about the developed structures/knowledge of language users. And, different linguistic theories of this structure seem differentially suited for nativist vs. empiricist theories. Most centrally, generativist approaches rely on quite abstract structures and operations, distant from the stimuli available to the learner, and thus suggestive of innate constraints; whereas constructionist/usage-based views tend to be more “surface-oriented”, involving abstraction from linguistic stimuli, but with clear resemblance to them, and are thus more aligned with empiricist learning mechanisms. If we could get neurobiological data suggestive that one of these approaches to adult grammars were on the right track, this would be powerful evidence in the nativist/empiricist debate. However, for reasons spelled out in Embick and Poeppel (2015), we remain quite far from such evidence. There is a “granularity mismatch” between linguistic theory and neuroscience, such that neuroscientific theories tend to locate linguistic functions at a much more abstract level than linguistic theories do, e.g., identifying the locus of syntactic or phonological processing, rather than identifying specific features, items, or operations, as posited in linguistic theories. Until this bridge is crossed, inferences from neuroscience to (developmental) linguistics will remain risky.

B.4 Genetics/FoxP2

Claims that language is an innate trait has historically, and reasonably, been associated with claims that there is a genetic/genomic basis for language, i.e., that there is something about the human genome, absent from non-human organisms, which enables them both to acquire a language and which constrains the languages they are able to learn. The case of Specific Language Impairment in the above-mentioned family studied by Myrna Gopnik provided the first widely discussed window into the genetic prerequisites for language acquisition. In this family, SLI was inherited in a pattern highly suggestive of a classical Mendelian dominant trait. Subsequent research (Lai, Fisher, Hurst, Vargha-Khadem, & Monaco 2001) identified a defect in the FoxP2 gene as the source of this trait, which led to popular discussions of FoxP2 as the ‘language gene’. This, for a while, bolstered the case for the linguistic nativist: what could better demonstrate that language is innate than the discovery of the genes responsible for it?

However, as always, things are not as easy as this. Firstly, it is near-universally accepted within biology and the philosophy of biology that there is little sense to the claim that a specific gene can be viewed as the cause or explanation of a phenotypic trait (Godfrey-Smith 2000), and so talk of a “language gene” can be, at best, a misleading metaphor. The point is a general one: genes, if they ‘code’ for anything, code for proteins, not traits, and how the production of a specific protein at a specific location and time in the organism’s development will influence the developed system is highly context-sensitive, relying on myriad other features of both the organism and their environment.

Secondly, further research into FoxP2 showed exactly this kind of developmental complexity. FoxP2 is a transcription factor, functioning to regulate the protein production of other cells, and seems to be involved in the development not just of the brain, but also of the heart, lungs, and digestive system. Defects in FoxP2 likewise do not lead specifically to linguistic deficits, with typical symptoms in SLI including orofacial dyspraxia, a difficulty in coordinating movements of the face and mouth, and more general intellectual impairment (average IQ of affected members of the KE family was 75, compared to 86 in the unaffected family members, Varga-Khadem et al. 1995). FoxP2 thus may play a crucial role in language development, but cannot be seen as a “blueprint” for UG, encoding the facts about developed language which PoS arguments aim to highlight.

Finally, while nativists, including Chomsky, have often described their view in terms of genetic or genomic explanations for human linguistic capacities, this is not essential to the nativist program. In recent years, Chomsky has appealed to the role of ‘third factor’, i.e., neither genomic nor environmental, explanations for why language is the way it is. The idea is that general laws of form and development of cognitive, biological, and even physical, systems might play a more substantial role in explaining why human languages may take the restricted range of forms that they do. These “non-genomic nativist” accounts (Cherniak 2009) thus limit the inferential connections between linguistic nativism and evidence from the human genome.

B.5 Language Universals

Much early discussion of linguistic nativism focused, perhaps due to the term ‘Universal Grammar’, on Language Universals. The connection between linguistic nativism and language universals is an intuitive one: if some feature of the human language faculty must be posited as present prior to linguistic experience, in order to account for some aspect of language acquisition, then we should expect to see it evidenced across languages. However, as we shall see, inferences between claims about innateness and claims about universals are contentious and again this area, once at the center of these debates, has not managed to change many minds.

The first thing to note is that there are no entailments between these two domains. PoS arguments aim to establish something about the initial state of the language faculty; what children must know in order to learn the languages they do. Universals, on the other hand, are generalizations, either absolute (all languages have property X) or conditional (any language with property Y must also have property Z), about adult language. But linguistic development could involve losing some linguistic knowledge, in which case the innate component might not be reflected in adult language. So innate linguistic knowledge is compatible with an absence of any linguistic universal. Infants display an ability to identify phonemic contrasts which are absent from the language they are learning, but this ability disappears by the time they learn their native language. For example, Hindi speaking adults, and English learning infants, but not English speaking adults, are able to distinguish between retroflex and dental stops (differentiated by the placement of the tip of the tongue), which is contrastive in Hindi but not in English (Werker & Tees 1983). Amazingly, we see the same “perceptual narrowing” effect in monolingual hearing children when exposed to signed languages, where these children who have never been exposed to signed language categorically distinguish linguistic signs at 4 months, but lose this ability by 14 months (Petitto 2005). There is thus no entailment from what is innate to what is present in the developed mind. In the other direction, the fact that we find some feature present across all world languages does not guarantee that it is reflective of some innate constraint. Alternative explanations for ubiquity, such as functional or historical accounts, are possible.

Another difficulty in leveraging claims about universality in the nativism debate is that “language universal” can mean at least two quite different things. As Evans and Levinson (2009) note, this term has traditionally been associated with the typological linguistic work of Joseph Greenberg (1966). Greenberg’s work adopts a roughly inductive approach: simply catalogue various properties of a sample of world languages (e.g., word-order, phonemic catalogue, etc.), and identify whatever generalizations there are. Greenberg universals are in this sense descriptive. These are contrasted with the sense of ‘universal’ in “Universal grammar” (and the derivative “Chomsky universal”), where what is purported to be universal is some aspect of the cognitive system, the grammar. Because grammars are theoretical posits, and may be reflected more-or-less indirectly in observable speech, identifying Chomsky universals is a more difficult, and theoretically-laden, project. However, if anything can be gleaned about innateness from language universals, this must go by way of Chomsky universals, as it is the grammar, or knowledge, of the speaker, not the speech itself, which PoS arguments target.

Despite these difficulties, various nativists have proposed several linguistic universals, and used these as premises in an argument for linguistic nativism (e.g., Pinker & Bloom 1990; Baker 2002). The argument here is an abductive one: if we find, in language after language, the same properties (be they structural or substantive), a plausible explanation is that there is some aspect of human linguistic cognition which ensures that only languages with these properties are possible, i.e., that our innate endowment determines the space of possible languages in terms of these universal properties.

Perhaps the most famous challenge to this argument is found in Evans and Levinson (2009). They attack the empirical premise, arguing that there are in fact no universals which genuinely apply to all studied human languages, and thus that there is nothing for a hypothesized UG to explain. They discuss, inter alia, one of the most general, and widely cited, linguistic universals: Constituency, according to which all languages structure complex expressions by hierarchically grouping together simple expressions at levels larger than a word but smaller than a sentence. For example, in English, the sentence “The professor scolded the students” is not simply a “flat” structure, with five words concatenated into a string, but decomposes into intermediate phrases, ‘the professor’ and ‘scolded the students’, which themselves further decompose. Evans and Levinson claim that constituency analysis of this type works well for many of the languages studied and spoken by most professional linguists, but fails as applied to free word order languages like classical Latin and several Australian languages like Thalanyji and Jiwarli. In these languages, strong Case-marking systems make linear grouping redundant, and so words which are semantically related can be distributed throughout the sentence, in ways that prevent any coherent, contiguous constituent from being identified in the uttered sentence.

This example is instructive. Nativist linguists will respond (see, e.g., the responses by Baker 2009; Pesetsky 2009; and Tallerman 2009) that Constituency was never claimed to directly constrain surface word order, but was instead a claim about the way complex expressions are constructed and represented in the minds of language users. That is, it is a proposed Chomsky universal, not a Greenberg universal. It is compatible with Constituency, construed as a claim about the hierarchical structures the language faculty makes available, that sentences in Latin have constituents, but that some process involved in mapping these hierarchical structures onto speech behavior obscures this fact. Evans and Levinson claim that such a response amounts to special pleading: hypothesizing some observation which ‘undoes’ the constituency structure purported to be cognitively real, so that this is not evidenced in the data.

Another, highly publicized, dispute of exactly this sort involves the Amazonian language Pirahã. Chomsky has long viewed recursion, the ability to generate novel expressions by nesting expressions of the same type within one another (e.g., embedding a sentence inside another sentence, as in “[Chomsky thinks that [Everett’s beliefs about language are false]]”), as a, if not the, characteristic property of human languages (see Hauser, Chomsky, & Fitch 2002 for the stronger claim). Daniel Everett (2005) has argued that this purported linguistic universal is shown to be false by consideration of Pirahã. Pirahã, he argues, does not display any degree of syntactic embedding. Thoughts which in English would be expressed with embedded clauses are expressed instead in Pirahã by simply juxtaposing two distinct sentences, without one being syntactically within the other. For example, temporal embedding in English (e.g., “when I finish eating, I want to talk to you”) in which one clause is subordinated to the other in the scope of a temporal adverb, is not present in Pirahã. Instead, the two clauses are simply placed next to one another: Everett (2005) analyzes the comparable Pirahã utterance as “I finish eating, I speak to you” (2005: 630). If Everett is correct in his analysis of Pirahã (although see Nevins, Pesetsky, & Rodrigues 2009 for reasons to doubt this), this would undermine recursion as a Greenberg universal. However, this does not, on its own at least, have any particular implications for recursion as a Chomsky universal, i.e., as a claim about how Pirahã speakers cognize and generate mental representations of expressions in their language, nor about innateness.

In these cases, and many others, the variability of linguistic behavior (i.e., the relative sparsity of Greenberg universals) ensures that any Chomsky universals will be very abstract, governing computations and representations at considerable distance from observable linguistic behavior. Such abstract universals are therefore identified only through complex and subtle forms of theory construction and evaluation. Evans and Levinson are right that one does have to squint considerably to see language as constrained in the ways proposed by linguistic nativists. But that does not show that these claims are false, just that they are theoretical and contentious. In practice, this means that there is considerable leeway for participants in these debates to adopt the theories which make good on their theoretical commitments. Nativists can feel justified in endorsing these quite abstract theoretically-laden descriptions of the constraints on UG, and non-nativists can rest content in the observation that languages appear to vary considerably. And so, despite several decades of debate, it is not clear that language universals have played a substantial role in deciding these issues, although the issues remain empirical and so could do so in the future.

B.6 Critical/Sensitive Periods

In one of the founding texts of the modern study of language as a biological trait, Eric Lenneberg (1967) makes the case for nativism by appealing to the rigid schedule claimed to govern human language acquisition. Lenneberg claimed that humans must acquire their language within a specific window, a ‘critical period’. Failure to learn language before this window closed would make full fluency difficult if not impossible. This hypothesis would then explain why it is so rare for adults to achieve fluency in a second language.

The discussion in Curtiss and colleagues (1974) of Genie, a child raised in heartbreaking circumstances, who was almost entirely deprived of linguistic interaction until she was 13 years old, provided a widely discussed case study for investigating this hypothesis. With substantial explicit instruction from foster parents and the language scientists who studied her, Genie was able to acquire some linguistic abilities, using multi-word utterances with semantically significant word ordering, and displaying comprehension of some inflectional morphology. Curtiss took this to undermine the strictest interpretation of the critical period hypothesis. But Genie never mastered English, nor the signed language she was introduced to at a later age, which has been taken as evidence that there is something crucial about early exposure to language. This piece of evidence, however, is clearly highly confounded by the extreme deprivation Genie was placed under, and the more general cognitive difficulties this resulted in.

The connection between a critical period and innateness consists in the idea that, for the nativist, language acquisition is, to a substantial degree, a matter of biological development rather than stimulus-driven learning. Assuming that exposure to the relevant evidence about the possible and impossible constructions in a given language is present throughout the learner’s life, an empiricist approach can not easily explain why learning must occur at a specific moment in the life cycle. Whereas for the nativist, there are numerous cases in biology in which a particular developmental process must occur at a specific moment. Most famously, Wiesel and Hubel (1963) showed that the development of binocular vision in kittens was irreversibly blocked if visual information was not made available to both eyes within the first three months of life. If language acquisition was like this, and followed a tightly constrained, internally driven, developmental schedule, this seemed like strong evidence for an innate component.

However, over half a century later, the critical period hypothesis, and the support it provides for nativism about language, remain highly controversial. A recent review article (Hartshorne 2022: 149) claims that “Despite half a century of research, we know fairly little about when and where older learners struggle to acquire language, much less why”. It is widely accepted that children are indeed better at learning languages than adults, although there is significant inter-personal variation, and different linguistic abilities seem to be affected differently (e.g., many adult learners seem able to master the grammar of a second language, but mastery of the phonetics seems much rarer). But estimates of the timing of this shift are much more variable. Hartshorne, Tenenbaum, and Pinker (2018) suggest that no sharp drop in language-learning abilities for grammar is detectable until 17 years, long after the estimates of earlier theorists. And many theorists have argued that ‘sensitive period’ is a better name for this phenomenon, reflecting the gradual, rather than categorical, degradation of acquisitional abilities. One further difficulty with drawing firm conclusions from this research is that it is often unclear exactly what the standards are for ‘full mastery’ or ‘fluency’. Native speakers are, near-definitionally, fluent. But a category like ‘native English speaker’ is a quite heterogeneous one, including many varying dialects. One must take care in studying second-language learners to ensure that one is not holding their language skills up to standards that would be inappropriately normative if applied to speakers of, say, a non-prestige dialect.

Finally, even if it could be established that there is a critical period for language acquisition, the line from this to linguistic nativism is not as clear as is sometimes suggested. Plunkett and colleagues (1997) have argued that critical periods can be observed in connectionist networks, without inbuilt linguistic biases. The very rough idea is that, because training a connectionist network leads to stable attractor states, stimuli encountered earlier will be more capable of shifting network properties than those encountered later. Thus, if language learning does not begin until the network has, to some extent, settled into a stable state, it will be more difficult to shift it into a distinct state capable of correctly handling linguistic input. And so even non-nativists about language can explain the existence of differences between adult and child language learners.